xy[z(z
x
zy)
x=y]
| This is a file in the archives of the Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy. |
Extensionality:This axiom asserts that when sets x and y have the same members, they are the same set.
The next axiom asserts the existence of the empty set:
Null Set:Since it is provable from this axiom and the previous axiom that there is a unique such set, we may introduce the notation ‘Ø’ to denote it.
x
x)
The next axiom asserts that if given any set x and y, there exists a pair set of x and y, i.e., a set which has only x and y as members:
Pairs:Since it is provable that there is a unique pair set for each given x and y, we introduce the notation ‘{x,y}’ to denote it.
w=y)
The next axiom asserts that for any given set x, there is a set y which has as members all of the members of all of the members of x:
Unions:Since it is provable that there is a unique ‘union’ of any set x, we introduce the notation ‘
x’ to denote it.
The next axiom asserts that for any set x, there is a set y which contains as members all those sets whose members are also elements of x, i.e., y contains all of the subsets of x:
Power Set:Since every set provably has a unique `power set', we introduce the notation ‘
(x)’ to denote it.
Note also that we may define the notion x is a subset of y
(‘x 
y’) as:
z(zx
zy).
Then we may simplify the statement of the Power Set Axiom as
follows:
The next axiom asserts the existence of an infinite set, i.e., a set with an infinite number of members:
Infinity:We may think of this as follows. Let us define the union of x and y (‘x
y’) as the
union of the pair set of x and y, i.e., as {x,y}. Then the Axiom of Infinity
asserts that there is a set x which contains Ø as a
member and which is such that, anytime y is a member of
x, then y{y} is a member
of x. Consequently, this axiom guarantees the existence of a
set of the following form:
{Ø, {Ø}, {Ø, {Ø}}, {Ø, {Ø}, {Ø, {Ø}}}, … }Notice that the second element, {Ø}, is in this set because (1) the fact that Ø is in the set implies that Ø
{Ø} is in the set and (2) Ø
{Ø} just is {Ø}. Similarly, the third
element, {Ø, {Ø}}, is in this set because (1) the fact
that {Ø} is in the set implies that {Ø}
{{Ø}} is in the set and (2) {Ø}
{{Ø}} just is {Ø, {Ø}}. And so
forth.
The next axiom asserts that every set is ‘well-founded’:
Regularity:A member y of a set x with this property is called a ‘minimal’ element. This axiom rules out the existence of circular chains of sets (e.g., such as x
Ø
y &
yz & and
zx) as well as infinitely
descending chains of sets (such as …
x3
x2
x1
x0).
The final axiom of ZF is the Replacement Schema. Suppose that 
(x,y,
) is a
formula with x and y free, and which may or may not
have free variables
z1,…,zk. Furthermore,
let x,y,
[s,r,]
be the result of substituting s and r for
x and y, respectively, in
(x,y,). The
every instance of the following schema is an axiom:
Replacement Schema:In other words, if we know that
is a functional
formula (which relates each set x to a unique set y),
then if we are given a set u, we can form a new set
v as follows: collect all of the sets to which the members
of u are uniquely related by .
Note that the Replacement Schema can take you ‘out of’ the set
u when forming the set v. The elements of
v need not be elements of u. By contrast,
the well-known Separation Schema of Zermelo yields
new sets consisting only of those elements of a given set u
which satisfy a certain condition
. That is, suppose that
(x,) has
x free and may or may not have
z1,…,zk free.
Then the Separation Schema asserts:
Separation SchemaIn other words, if given a formula
and a set u,
there exists a set v which has as members precisely the members
of u which satisfy the formula .
| Thomas Jech jech@math.cas.cz |