Conventionality of Simultaneity
In his first paper on the special theory of relativity, Einstein
indicated that the question of whether or not two spatially separated
events were simultaneous did not necessarily have a definite answer,
but instead depended on the adoption of a convention for its
resolution. Some later writers have argued that Einstein's
choice of a convention is, in fact, the only possible choice within
the framework of special relativistic physics, while others have
maintained that alternative choices, although perhaps less
convenient, are indeed possible.
Prior to Einstein's first paper on relativity (Einstein, 1905),
it was generally agreed that simultaneity was absolute; i.e., that
there was a unique event at location A that was simultaneous with a
given event at location B. Einstein, however, said that it was
necessary to make an assumption in order to be able to compare the
times of occurrence of events at spatially separated locations
(Einstein, 1905, pp. 38-40 of the Dover translation or pp. 125-127 of
the Princeton translation; but note Scribner, 1963, for correction of
an error in the Dover translation). His assumption, which defined
what is usually called standard synchrony, can be described in terms
of the following idealized thought experiment, where the spatial
locations A and B are fixed locations in some particular, but
arbitrary, inertial (i.e., unaccelerated) frame of reference: Let a
light ray, traveling in vacuum, leave A at time t1 (as
measured by a clock at rest there), and arrive at B coincident with
the event E at B. Let the ray be instantaneously reflected back to A,
arriving at time t2. Then standard synchrony is defined
by saying that E is simultaneous with the event at A that occurred at
time (t1 + t2)/2. This definition is equivalent
to the requirement that the one-way speeds of the ray be the same on
the two segments of its round-trip journey between A and B.
The thesis that the choice of standard synchrony is a convention,
rather than one necessitated by facts about the physical universe
(within the framework of the special theory of relativity), has been
argued particularly by Reichenbach (see, for example, Reichenbach,
1958, pp. 123-135) and Grünbaum (see, for example,
Grünbaum, 1973, pp. 342-368). They argue that the only
nonconventional basis for claiming that two distinct events are not
simultaneous would be the possibility of a causal influence
connecting the events. In the pre-Einsteinian view of the universe,
there was no reason to rule out the possibility of arbitrarily fast
causal influences, which would then be able to single out a unique
event at A that would be simultaneous with E. In an Einsteinian
universe, however, no causal influence can travel faster than the
speed of light in vacuum, so from the point of view of Reichenbach
and Grünbaum, any event at A whose time of occurrence is in the
open interval between t1 and t2 could be
defined to be simultaneous with E. In terms of the
-notation introduced by
Reichenbach, any event at A occurring at a time t1 +
(t2 - t1), where
0 <
< 1, could be
simultaneous with E. That is, the conventionality thesis asserts that
any particular choice of
within
its stated range is a matter of convention, including the choice
=1/2 (which corresponds to standard
synchrony). If
differs from 1/2, the one-way speeds of a light ray would differ (in an
-dependent
fashion) on the two segments of its round-trip journey between A and
B. If, more generally, we consider light traveling on an arbitrary
closed path in three-dimensional space, then (as shown by Minguzzi,
2002, pp.155-156) the freedom of choice in the one-way speeds of
light amounts to the choice of an arbitrary scalar field (although
two scalar fields that differ only by an additive constant would give
the same assignment of one-way speeds).
It might be argued that the definition of
standard synchrony makes use only of the relation of equality (of the
one-way speeds of light in different directions), so that simplicity
dictates its choice rather than a choice that requires the
specification of a particular value for a parameter. Grünbaum
(1973, p. 356) rejects this argument on the grounds that, since the
equality of the one-way speeds of light is a convention, this choice
does not simplify the postulational basis of the theory but only
gives a symbolically simpler representation.
Many of the arguments against the conventionality thesis make use of
particular physical phenomena, together with the laws of physics, to
establish simultaneity (or, equivalently, to measure the one-way
speed of light). Salmon (1977), for example, discusses a number of
such schemes and argues that each makes use of a nontrivial
convention. For instance, one such scheme uses the law of
conservation of momentum to conclude that two particles of equal
mass, initially located halfway between A and B and then separated by
an explosion, must arrive at A and B simultaneously. Salmon (1977,
p. 273) argues, however, that the standard formulation of the law of
conservation of momentum makes use of the concept of one-way
velocities, which cannot be measured without the use of (something
equivalent to) synchronized clocks at the two ends of the spatial
interval that is traversed; thus, it is a circular argument to use
conservation of momentum to define simultaneity.
It has been argued (see, for example, Janis, 1983, pp. 103-105, and
Norton, 1986, p. 119) that all such schemes for establishing
convention-free synchrony must fail. The argument can be summarized as
follows: Suppose that clocks are set in standard synchrony, and
consider the detailed space-time description of the proposed
synchronization procedure that would be obtained with the use of such
clocks. Next suppose that the clocks are reset in some nonstandard
fashion (consistent with the causal order of events), and consider the
description of the same sequence of events that would be obtained with
the use of the reset clocks. In such a description, familiar laws may
take unfamiliar forms, as in the case of the law of conservation of
momentum in the example mentioned above. Indeed, all of special
relativity has been reformulated (in an unfamiliar form) in terms of
nonstandard synchronies (Winnie, 1970a and 1970b). Since the proposed
synchronization procedure can itself be described in terms of a
nonstandard synchrony, the scheme cannot describe a sequence of events
that is incompatible with nonstandard synchrony. A comparison of the
two descriptions makes clear what hidden assumptions in the scheme are
equivalent to standard synchrony.
A phenomenological scheme that deserves special mention, because of
the amount of attention it has received over the course of many
years, is to define synchrony by the use of clocks transported
between locations A and B in the limit of zero velocity. Eddington
(1924, p. 15) discusses this method of synchrony, and notes that it
leads to the same results as those obtained by the use of
electromagnetic signals (the method that has been referred to here as
standard synchrony). He comments on both of these methods as follows
(1924, pp. 15-16): "We can scarcely consider that either of these
methods of comparing time at different places is an essential part of
our primitive notion of time in the same way that measurement at one
place by a cyclic mechanism is; therefore they are best regarded as
conventional."
One objection to the use of the slow-transport scheme to synchronize
clocks is that, until the clocks are synchronized, there is no way of
measuring the one-way velocity of the transported clock. Bridgman
(1962, p. 26) uses the "self-measured" velocity, determined by using
the transported clock to measure the time interval, to avoid this
problem. Using this meaning of velocity, he suggests (1962,
pp. 64-67) a modified procedure that is equivalent to
Eddington's, but does not require having started in the infinite
past. Bridgman would transport a number of clocks from A to B at
various velocities; the readings of these clocks at B would
differ. He would then pick one clock, say the one whose velocity was
the smallest, and find the differences between its reading and the
readings of the other clocks. Finally, he would plot these
differences against the velocities of the corresponding clocks, and
extrapolate to zero velocity. Like Eddington, Bridgman does not see
this scheme as contradicting the conventionality thesis. He says
(1962, p.66), "What becomes of Einstein's insistence that his
method for setting distant clocks -- that is, choosing the value 1/2
for
-- constituted a ‘definition’ of distant simultaneity? It
seems to me that Einstein's remark is by no means
invalidated."
Ellis and Bowman (1967) take a different point of view. Their means
of synchronizing clocks by slow transport (1967, pp. 129-130) is
again somewhat different from, but equivalent to, those already
mentioned. They would place clocks at A and B with arbitrary
settings. They would then place a third clock at A and synchronize it
with the one already there. Next they would move this third clock to
B with a velocity they refer to as the "intervening
‘velocity’", determined by using the clocks in place at A
and B to measure the time interval. They would repeat this procedure
with decreasing velocities and extrapolate to find the zero-velocity
limit of the difference between the readings of the clock at B and
the transported clock. Finally, they would set the clock at B back by
this limiting amount. On the basis of their analysis of this
procedure, they argue that, although consistent nonstandard
synchronization appears to be possible, there are good physical
reasons (assuming the correctness of empirical predictions of the
special theory of relativity) for preferring standard
synchrony. Their conclusion (as summarized in the abstract of their
1967, p. 116) is, "The thesis of the conventionality of distant
simultaneity espoused particularly by Reichenbach and Grünbaum
is thus either trivialized or refuted."
A number of responses to these views of Ellis and Bowman (see, for
example, Grünbaum et al., 1969; Winnie, 1970b, pp. 223-228; and
Redhead, 1993, pp. 111-113) argue that nontrivial conventions are
implicit in the choice to synchronize clocks by the slow-transport
method. For example, Grünbaum (Grünbaum et al., 1969, pp.
5-43) argues that it is a nontrivial convention to equate the time
interval measured by the infinitely slowly moving clock traveling
from A to B with the interval measured by the clock remaining at A
and in standard synchrony with that at B, and the conclusion of van
Fraassen (Grünbaum et al., 1969, p. 73) is, "Ellis and Bowman
have not proved that the standard simultaneity relation is
nonconventional, which it is not, but have succeeded in exhibiting
some alternative conventions which also yield that
simultaneity relation." Winnie (1970b), using his reformulation of
special relativity in terms of arbitrary synchrony, shows explicitly
that synchrony by slow-clock transport agrees with synchrony by the
standard light-signal method when both are described in terms of an
arbitrary value of
within the range 0 <
< 1, and argues that Ellis and
Bowman err in having assumed the
=1/2 form of
the time-dilation formula in their arguments. He concludes (Winnie,
1970b, p. 228) that "it is not possible that the method of
slow-transport, or any other synchrony method, could, within the
framework of the nonconventional ingredients of the Special
Theory, result in fixing any particular value of
to the exclusion of any other
particular values." Redhead (1993) also argues that slow transport of
clocks fails to give a convention-free definition of simultaneity. He
says (1993, p. 112), "There is no absolute factual sense in the term
‘slow.’ If we estimate ‘slow’ relative to a
moving frame K', then slow-clock-transport will pick out
standard synchrony in K', but this ... corresponds to
nonstandard synchrony in K."
An alternative clock-transport scheme, which avoids the issue of
slowness, is to have the clock move from A to B and back again (along
straight paths in each direction) with the same self-measured speed
throughout the round trip (Mamone Capria, 2001, pp. 812-813; as
Mamone Capria notes, his scheme is similar to those propoosed by
Brehme, 1985, pp. 57-58, and 1988, pp. 811-812). If the moving clock
leaves A at time t1 (as measured by a clock at rest
there), arrives at B coincident with the event E at B, and arrives
back at A at the time t2, then standard synchrony is
obtained by saying that E is simultaneous with the event at A that
occurred at the time (t1 + t2)/2. It would seem
that this transport scheme is sufficiently similar to the
slow-transport scheme that it could engender much the same debate,
apart from those aspects of the debate that focussed specifically on
the issue of slowness.
An entirely different sort of argument against the conventionality
thesis has been given by Malament (1977), who argues that standard
synchrony is the only simultaneity relation that can be defined,
relative to a given inertial frame, from the relation of (symmetric)
causal connectibility. Let this relation be represented by
,
let the statement that events p and q are simultaneous be
represented by S(p,q), and let the given inertial frame be specified
by the world line, O, of some inertial observer. Then Malament's
uniqueness theorem shows that if S is definable from
and O, if it is an equivalence relation,
if points p on O and q not on O exist such that S(p,q) holds, and if S
is not the universal relation (which holds for all points), then S is
the relation of standard synchrony.
Some commentators have taken Malament's theorem to have settled
the debate on the side of nonconventionality. For example, Torretti
(1983, p. 229) says, "Malament proved that simultaneity by standard
synchronism in an inertial frame F is the only non-universal
equivalence between events at different points of F that is definable
(‘in any sense of "definable" no matter how weak’) in terms
of causal connectibility alone, for a given F"; and Norton (Salmon et
al., 1992, p. 222) says, "Contrary to most expectations, [Malament]
was able to prove that the central claim about simultaneity of the
causal theorists of time was false. He showed that the standard
simultaneity relation was the only nontrivial simultaneity relation
definable in terms of the causal structure of a Minkowski spacetime
of special relativity."
Other commentators disagree with such arguments, however.
Grünbaum (as reported by Norton in Salmon et al., 1992, p. 226)
and Redhead (1993, p.114) cite Malament's need to postulate that
S is an equivalence relation as a weakness in the argument. Havas
(1987, p. 444) says, "What Malament has shown, in fact, is that in
Minkowski space-time ... one can always introduce time-orthogonal
coordinates ..., an obvious and well-known result which implies
=1/2." Janis (1983, pp. 107-109)
argues that Malament's theorem leads to a unique (but different)
synchrony relative to any inertial observer, that this latitude is
the same as that in introducing Reichenbach's
, and thus Malament's
theorem should carry neither more nor less weight against the
conventionality thesis than the argument (mentioned
above in the last paragraph of the first
section of this article) that standard synchrony is the simplest
choice. Similarly, Redhead (1993, p. 114) says that "we can use the
same argument as we did for slow-clock-transport to demonstrate that
we are faced with a conventional choice betweeen standard synchronies
defined à la Malament in all possible inertial frames." In a
comprehensive review of the problem of the conventionality of
simultaneity, Anderson, Vetharaniam, and Stedman (1998, pp. 124-125)
claim that Malament's proof is erroneous. Although they appear
to be wrong in this claim, the nature of their error highlights the
fact that Malament's proof, which uses the time-symmetric
relation
, would not be valid if a temporal
orientation were introduced into space-time (see, for example,
Spirtes, 1981, Ch. VI, Sec. F; and Stein, 1991, p. 153n).
Sarkar and Stachel (1999) argue that there is no physical warrant for
the requirement that a simultaneity relation be invariant under
temporal reflections. Dropping that requirement, they show that
Malament's other criteria for a simultaneity relation are then
also satisfied if we fix some arbitrary event in space-time and say
either that any pair of events on its backward null cone are
simultaneous or, alternatively, that any pair of events on its
forward null cone are simultaneous. They show further that, among the
relations satisfying these requirements, standard synchrony is the
unique such relation that is independent of the position of an
observer and the half-null-cone relations are the unique such
relations that are independent of the motion of an observer. If the
backward-cone relation were chosen, then simultaneous events would be
those seen simultaneously by an observer at the cone's
vertex. As Sarkar and Stachel (1999, p. 209) note, Einstein (1905,
p. 39 of the Dover translation or p. 126 of the Princeton
translation) considered this possibility and rejected it because of
its dependence on the position of the observer. Since the
half-null-cone relations define causally connectible events to be
simultaneous, it would seem that they would also be rejected by
adherents of the views of Reichenbach and Grünbaum.
Giulini (2001, p.653) argues that it is too strong a requirement to
ask that a simultaneity relation be invariant under causal
transformations (such as scale transformations) that are not physical
symmetries, which Malament as well as Sarkar and Stachel do. Using
"Aut" to refer to the appropriate invariance group and "nontrivial"
to refer to an equivalence relation on spacetime that is neither one
in which all points are in the same equivalence class nor one in
which each point is in a different equivalence class, Giulini (2001,
pp. 657-658) defines two types of simultaneity: Absolute simultaneity
is a nontrivial Aut-invariant equivalence relation on spacetime such
that each equivalence class intersects any physically realizable
timelike trajectory in at most one point, and simultaneity relative
to some structure X in spacetime (for Malament, X is the world line
of an inertial observer) is a nontrivial AutX-invariant
equivalence relation on spacetime such that each equivalence class
intersects any physically realizable timelike trajectory in at most
one point, where AutX is the subgroup of Aut that
preserves X. First taking Aut to be the inhomogeneous (i.e.,
including translations) Galilean transformations, Giulini (2001,
pp. 660-662) shows that standard Galilean (i.e., pre-relativistic)
simultaneity is the unique absolute simultaneity relation. Then
taking Aut to be the inhomogeneous Lorentz tansformations (also known
as the Poincaré transformations), Giulini (2001, pp. 664-666)
shows that there is no absolute simultaneity relation and that
standard Einsteinian synchrony is the unique relative simultaneity
when X is taken to be a foliation of spacetime by straight lines
(thus, like Malament, singling out a specific inertial frame, but in
a way that is different from Malament's choice of X).
Since the conventionality thesis rests upon the existence of a
fastest causal signal, the existence of arbitrarily fast causal
signals would undermine the thesis. If we leave aside the question of
causality, for the moment, the possibility of particles (called
tachyons) moving with arbitrarily high velocities is consistent with
the mathematical formalism of special relativity (see, for example,
Feinberg, 1967). Just as the speed of light in vacuum is an upper
limit to the possible speeds of ordinary particles (sometimes called
bradyons), it would be a lower limit to the speeds of tachyons. When
a transformation is made to a different inertial frame of reference,
the speeds of both bradyons and tachyons change (the speed of light
in vacuum being the only invariant speed). At any instant, the speed
of a bradyon can be transformed to zero and the speed of a tachyon
can be transformed to an infinite value. The statement that a bradyon
is moving forward in time remains true in every inertial frame (if it
is true in one), but this is not so for tachyons. Feinberg (1967)
argues that this does not lead to violations of causality through the
exchange of tachyons between two uniformly moving observers because
of ambiguities in the interpretation of the behavior of tachyon
emitters and absorbers, whose roles can change from one to the other
under the transformation between inertial frames. He claims to
resolve putative causal anomalies by adopting the convention that
each observer describes the motion of each tachyon interacting with
that observer's apparatus in such a way as to make the tachyon
move forward in time. However, all of Feinberg's examples
involve motion in only one spatial dimension. Pirani (1970) has given
an explicit two-dimensional example in which Feinberg's
convention is satisfied but a tachyon signal is emitted by an
observer and returned to that observer at an earlier time, thus
leading to possible causal anomalies.
A claim that no value of
other than 1/2 is
mathematically possible has been put forward by Zangari (1994). He
argues that spin-1/2 particles (e.g., electrons) must be represented
mathematically by what are known as complex spinors, and that the
transformation properties of these spinors are not consistent with
the introduction of nonstandard coordinates (corresponding to values
of
other than 1/2). Gunn and Vetharaniam (1995), however, present a
derivation of the Dirac equation (the fundamental equation describing
spin-1/2 particles) using coordinates that are consistent with
arbitrary synchrony. They argue that Zangari mistakenly required a
particular representation of space-time points as the only one
consistent with the spinorial description of spin-1/2 particles.
The debate about conventionality of simultaneity seems far from
settled, although some proponents on both sides of the argument might
disagree with that statement. The reader wishing to pursue the matter
further should consult the sources listed below as well as additional
references cited in those sources.
- Anderson, R., Vetharaniam, I., and Stedman, G. 1998.
"Conventionality of Synchronisation, Gauge Dependence and Test Theories
of Relativity," Physics Reports 295,
93-180.
- Brehme, R. 1985. "Response to ‘The Conventionality of
Synchronization’," American Journal of Physics
53, 56-59.
- Brehme, R. 1988. "On the Physical Reality of the Isotropic Speed
of Light," American Journal of Physics 56,
811-813.
- Bridgman, P. 1962. A Sophisticate's Primer of Relativity.
Middletown: Wesleyan University Press.
- Eddington, A. 1924. The Mathematical Theory of Relativity,
2nd ed. Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
- Einstein, A. 1905. "Zur Elektrodynamik bewegter Körper,"
Annalen der Physik 17, 891-921. English
translations in The Principle of Relativity, pp. 35-65. New
York: Dover, 1952; and in J. Stachel, ed., Einstein's Miraculous
Year, pp. 123-160. Princeton: Princeton University Press,
1998.
- Ellis, B. and Bowman, P. 1967. "Conventionality in Distant
Simultaneity," Philosophy of Science 34,
116-136.
- Feinberg, G. 1967. "Possibility of Faster-Than-Light Particles,"
Physical Review 159, 1089-1105.
- Giulini, D. 2001. "Uniqueness of Simultaneity," British
Journal for the Philosophy of Science 52,
651-670.
- Grünbaum, A. 1973. Philosophical Problems of Space and
Time, 2nd, enlarged ed. (Boston Studies in the Philosophy of
Science, vol. 12). Dordrecht/Boston: D. Reidel.
- Grünbaum, A., Salmon, W., van Fraassen, B., and Janis, A.
1969. "A Panel Discussion of Simultaneity by Slow Clock Transport in
the Special and General Theories of Relativity," Philosophy of
Science 36, 1-81.
- Gunn, D. and Vetharaniam, I. 1995. "Relativistic Quantum Mechanics
and the Conventionality of Simultaneity," Philosophy of
Science 62, 599-608.
- Havas, P. 1987. "Simultaneity, Conventionalism, General Covariance,
and the Special Theory of Relativity," General Relativity and
Gravitation 19, 435-453.
- Janis, A. 1983. "Simultaneity and Conventionality," in R. Cohen and
L. Laudan, eds., Physics, Philosophy and Psychoanalysis
(Boston Studies in the Philosophy of Science, vol. 76), pp.
101-110. Dordrecht/Boston: D. Reidel.
- Malament, D. 1977. "Causal Theories of Time and the Conventionality
of Simultaniety," Noûs 11,
293-300.
- Mamone Capria, M. 2001. "On the Conventionality of Simultaneity
in Special Relativity," Foundations of Physics
31, 775-818.
- Minguzzi, E. 2002. "On the Conventionality of Simultaneity,"
Foundations of Physics Letters 15,
153-169.
- Norton, J. 1986. "The Quest for the One Way Velocity of Light,"
British Journal for the Philosophy of Science
37, 118-120.
- Pirani, F. 1970. "Noncausal Behavior of Classical Tachyons,"
Physical Review D1, 3224-3225.
- Redhead M. 1993. "The Conventionality of Simultaneity," in J.
Earman, A. Janis, G. Massey, and N. Rescher, eds., Philosophical
Problems of the Internal and External Worlds, pp. 103-128.
Pittsburgh: University of Pittsburgh Press; Konstanz:
Universitätsverlag Konstanz.
- Reichenbach H. 1958. The Philosophy of Space & Time.
New York: Dover.
- Salmon, M., Earman, J., Glymour, C., Lennox, J., Machamer, P.,
McGuire, J., Norton, J., Salmon, W., and Schaffner, K. 1992.
Introduction to the Philosophy of Science. Englewood Cliffs:
Prentice Hall.
- Salmon, W. 1977. "The Philosophical Significance of the One-Way
Speed of Light," Noûs 11, 253-292.
- Sarkar, S. and Stachel, J. 1999. "Did Malament Prove the
Non-Conventionality of Simultaneity in the Special Theory of
Relativity?" Philosophy of Science 66,
208-220.
- Scribner, C. 1963. "Mistranslation of a Passage in Einstein's
Original Paper on Relativity," American Journal of Physics
31, 398.
- Spirtes, P. 1981. Conventionalism and the Philosophy of Henri
Poincaré. Ph. D. Dissertation, University of
Pittsburgh.
- Stein, H. 1991. "On Relativity Theory and Openness of the Future,"
Philosophy of Science 58, 147-167.
- Torretti, R. 1983. Relativity and Geometry. Oxford/New
York: Pergamon.
- Winnie, J. 1970a. "Special Relativity Without One-Way Velocity
Assumptions: Part I," Philosophy of Science
37, 81-99.
- Winnie, J. 1970b. "Special Relativity Without One-Way Velocity
Assumptions: Part II," Philosophy of Science
37, 223-238.
- Zangari, M. 1994. "A New Twist in the Conventionality of
Simultaneity Debate," Philosophy of Science
61, 267-275.
[Please contact the author with suggestions.]
causation: causal processes |
Einstein, Albert: philosophy of science |
Reichenbach, Hans
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