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Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy
Notes to The Hole Argument

Notes

1. This one example illustrates the core content of the hole argument. With only a little further effort, the argument can be made more precise and general. This will be done concurrently in these notes, intended for readers with some background in differential geometry and general relativity. The form of the argument follows that originally laid out in Earman and Norton (1987). For a development of the hole argument at a technical level intermediate between the body of this article and these notes, see Norton (1992a, Section 5.12).

In general, the class of theories in which the hole argument is mounted are "local spacetime theories." These are theories whose models consist of n+1 tuples

(M, O1, ..., On)
where the O1, ..., On are geometric object fields defined on a differential manifold M. The class of models in the theory is delimited by some set of invariant (e.g. tensorial) equations, which are the laws of the theory:
L1=0, ..., Lm=0
where the quantities Li are functions of the geometric objects Oi.The theory is presumed complete in the sense that any model satisfying these laws will be in the model set of the theory. This characterization of local spacetime theories is sufficiently general to include formulations of virtually all common spacetime theories, including general relativity, special relativity and Newtonian theories.

2. The distinction at issue here is between the passive and active reading of general covariance. Passive general covariance allows use of all coordinate charts of the differential manifold and is conferred automatically on theories formulated by modern methods. Active general covariance considers the dual point transformations induced by coordinate transformations. These amount to diffeomorphisms on the manifold M and the transformations of the fields correspond to maps that associate an object field O with its carry along h*O under diffeomorphism h.

The need to convert Einstein's original analysis from passive to active transformations is awkward. I have argued that the distinction between them was not so clear cut when Einstein originally formulated the hole argument because of the more impoverished mathematical environment in which he worked and that this is responsible for much of the present confusion in interpreting Einstein's pronouncements on coordinate systems. See Norton (1989, 1992).

3. That is, a hole transformation is a diffeomorphism on M that is the identity outside some arbitrarily selected neighborhood but comes smoothly to differ from the identity within that neighborhood. For an explicit construction of such a transformation, see Muller (1995).

4. More generally, manifold substantivalism asserts that the manifold M of local spacetime theories is the mathematical structure that represents spacetime.

5. For any spacetime model (M, O1, ..., On) and any diffeomorphism on M, Leibniz equivalence asserts that the two models

(M, O1, ..., On) and (hM, h*O1, ..., h*On)
represent the same physical system.

6. The general form of the argument is essentially identical. The first sentence is generalized to read:

1. If one has two models of a local spacetime theory (M, O1, ..., On) and (hM, h*O1, ..., h*On) related by a hole transformation h, manifold substantivalists must maintain that the two systems represent two distinct physical systems.

Note also that statements 1 and 2 are premises. Statement 3 is the conclusion drawn from them. There is a suppressed premise that it is inadmissible to load up a physical theory with hidden properties that outstrip both observation and the determining power of the theory.

Copyright © 1999
John Norton
jdnorton+@pitt.edu

Notes to The Hole Argument
Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy