Stanford  Encyclopedia  of Philosophy

Spring 2006 Edition Displaying Special Characters

This guide is divided into the following sections:

• 1. Microsoft Windows (XP, 2000, ME, 98) Users
• 2. Apple Mac OS X and Mac OS 9 Users
• 3. Linux, FreeBSD, Solaris, and other Unix OS Users
• 4. A Note About the Special Characters in our Entries

1. Microsoft Windows (XP, 2000, ME, 98) Users

Here are some things to do:

1. Some users need only use the Windows Update mechanism built into Internet Explorer to install support for the East Asian languages on your Windows machine. For some reason, this makes the Unicode fonts available to IE!
   • In IE select the Tools -> Windows Update menu item
   • In the window that comes up, choose to scan your system
   • If the scan completes and shows new updates to install, select Windows updates in the left frame of the window; if it says no new updates are available, then try Option 2 below
   • Under the Language Support category in the lower right frame, click the 'Add' button for each of the Asian languages (Chinese, Japanese, Korean) [we are not sure whether all of these are required, but they do seem to be jointly sufficient]
   • Click review and install in the upper right frame of the browser window
   • Wait for installation to complete
   • Restart web browser
2. If, after scanning your system, IE reports that there are no new updates available, you may instead have to use the Control Panel to install support for the East Asian languages on your Windows machine. Again, for some reason, this makes the Unicode fonts available to IE! Just follow the first 4 instructions on the following web page:

   Installing East Asian Language Support Under Windows XP
   Installing East Asian Language Support Under Windows Professional 2000

3. Alternatively, install and use any of the other web browsers mentioned below:

   Firefox
   Mozilla
   Camino
   Netscape 8   (Previous Netscape Versions)
   Opera

   Generally these browsers work without any special configuration under Windows XP and Windows 2000, but you may have to (a) follow Step 2 above and (b) set Preferences in these browsers to use a Unicode-enabled font (Lucida Sans Unicode, Arial, Times, Times New Roman), if you want to these browsers to display special characters on a Windows ME/98 machine.

2. Apple Mac OS X and Mac OS 9 Users

Mac OS X. The latest versions of Safari, Firefox, Camino, Netscape, Mozilla, and OmniWeb have all been tested successfully under Mac OS X. However, for the best results, you should set the font to Times or Lucida Grande, since these fonts seems to have the widest support for Unicode characters (including support for the Modifier Letters from Unicode Chart U0300.pdf) in Mac OS X. (Again, neither Times nor Lucida Grande supports a full set of Unicode characters, and you may need to switch your font from Lucida Grande to Times, or vice versa, on entries which have obscure characters.) We've also tested Opera with pretty good success (it fails to render only a few logical characters, namely, harr, rArr, and hArr).

Mac OS 9. Internet Explorer 5 on Mac OS 9 works surprisingly well if you set it to use the font Times New Roman. It has the ability to display most all of the special characters that are widely supported. We know of no way to configure Netscape 4.7 under Mac OS 9 so that it properly displays our pages and the Unicode characters which they use. There is reason to believe, however, that the unofficial build Mozilla 1.3.1 for Mac OS 9 will display our pages properly.

3. Linux, FreeBSD, Solaris, and other Unix OS Users

Firefox, Mozilla, Netscape, and Opera all provide reasonably good support for the special characters used in SEP entries, assuming you use the default font. However, we haven't test our pages with these systems as widely as we have the Windows and Mac platforms. So we cannot supply more specific information about what works best, i.e., what browser/font combination supports the widest range of Unicode characters.

4. A Note About the Special Characters in our Entries

We have tried to format our entries in XHTML so that they display properly in a wide range of web browsers. We have developed a web page of special characters which display correctly in a variety of current browsers. See

Widely Supported HTML 4 and Unicode Characters

But many of our entries use special symbols, such as logical, mathematical, and other symbols, which are not widely supported. Here is a list of such symbols:

Special Symbols Not Widely Supported

In the past, we used many more of the "low-resolution" screen shots of these characters and displayed the resulting graphics in the entry as small images, as we have done on the page cited immediately above. But, recently, after being convinced that there was wide support for Unicode characters among web browsers and operating systems, we starting replacing the low-resolution graphics with widely supported font-based Unicode characters. We are slowly but surely making all of our older entries compatible with the newer XHTML standard in the process. Indeed, we have now configured our publishing system so that our entries must parse as valid XHTML (i.e., be in compliance with the international standards set by the authoritative W3C organization) before they are published on the web. (We determine validity by sending our entries, pre-publication, to <http://validator.w3.org/> and fixing any errors reported when this engine tries to determine whether our documents are valid.)

Invariably, our best intentions are sometimes defeated by the technologies involved. If your browser is not properly displaying the named character entities in an entry (e.g., logical symbols, mathematical symbols, etc.), then we hope the above suggestions prove useful.