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Anicius Manlius Severinus Boethius

First published Fri May 6, 2005

Anicius Manlius Severinus Boethius (born: circa 475–7 C.E., died: 526? C.E.) has long been recognized as one of the most important intermediaries between ancient philosophy and the Latin Middle Ages and, through his Consolation of Philosophy, as a talented literary writer, with a gift for making philosophical ideas dramatic and accessible to a wider public. He had previously translated Aristotle's logical works into Latin, written commentaries on them as well as logical textbooks, and used his logical training to contribute to the theological discussions of the time. All these writings, which would be enormously influential in the Middle Ages, drew extensively on the thinking of Greek Neoplatonists such as Porphyry and Iamblichus. Recent work has also tried to identify and evaluate Boethius's own contribution, as an independent thinker, though one working within a tradition which put little obvious weight on philosophical originality. Both aspects of Boethius will be considered in the sections which follow.

1. Life and Works

Anicius Severinus Manlius Boethius was born into the Roman aristocracy c. 475–7 C.E.—about the same time as the last Roman Emperor, Romulus Augustulus was deposed (August 476). Boethius lived most of his life under the rule of Theoderic, an Ostrogoth educated at Constantinople, who was happy to let the old families keep up their traditions in Rome, while he wielded power in Ravenna. Boethius's privileged social position ensured that he was taught Greek thoroughly and, though it is unlikely that he travelled to Athens or Alexandria, the sites of the two remaining (Platonic) philosophical schools, he was certainly acquainted with a good deal of the work which had been going on there. He was able to spend most of his life in learned leisure, pursuing his vast project of translating and commenting philosophical texts. The Roman aristocracy was, by his day, thoroughly Christianized, and Boethius also became involved in some of the ecclesiastical disputes of his time, centring mainly around a schism between the Latin and the Greek Churches which was resolved shortly before his death.

Boethius's final years are well known to anyone who has read his most popular work, the Consolation of Philosophy. He agreed to become Theoderic's ‘Master of Offices’, one of the most senior officials, but he quickly fell out with many others at court, probably because he attacked their corruption. Accused of treason and of engaging in magic, he was imprisoned and (probably in 526) executed, but not before he had the chance to write his literary masterpiece.

The Consolation of Philosophy, a prosimetrum (a prose work with verse interludes) which recounts, in polished literary language, an imagined dialogue between the prisoner Boethius and a lady who personifies Philosophy, contrasts with the rest of Boethius's oeuvre. Besides writing text-books on arithmetic and geometry, closely based on Greek models, Boethius devoted himself to translating Aristotle's logic and commenting on it; he produced a commentary on the Categories and two each on On Interpretationand on the Isagoge (‘Introduction’) by Porphyry, which had become a standard part of the logical curriculum. He also composed logical text-books on division, categorical syllogisms, and on two branches of logic which will require further explanation (see below, Section 3): hypothetical syllogisms and topical reasoning (along with a commentary on Cicero's Topics). In three of his four Theological Treatises (often known as the Opuscula sacra), I, II and V, Boethius uses his logical equipment to tackle problems of Christian doctrine; IV, however, is a straightforward statement of Christian doctrine, a sort of confession of faith; whilst III is a brief, not specifically Christian philosophical treatise.

2. The Logical Project and the Logical Commentaries

Boethius's work as a translator and commentator of Aristotelian logic might appear to be just the beginning of a wider project, announced in the second commentary on On Interpretation (c. 516), and cut short by his execution, to translate and comment on all the writings of Plato and Aristotle. Yet Boethius seems to have become so engrossed in his role as an expositor of logic, not limiting himself to a single commentary on each work, and writing extra textbooks, that is hard not to see it as having diverted him, in any case, from his more grandiose scheme. Indeed, Boethius seems to have pursued a rather special logical project.

The particular, deliberate nature of this project is not cast into doubt by the fact that Boethius's logical commentaries, although almost certainly not merely servile translations of marginalia from a Greek manuscript (as James Shiel (1990) has argued), are not at all original in their logical doctrines. For what is important is Boethius's choice of Porphyry as his main authority in logic. It was Porphyry who, two centuries or so earlier, had been responsible for making Aristotelian logic an important subject within the Neoplatonic curriculum. He held that it did not conflict with Platonic doctrine, as his teacher Plotinus had believed, because its area of application was limited to the sensible world, to which everyday language refers. Later Neoplatonists accepted the importance of Aristotelian logic, and the harmony between Platonic and Aristotelian teaching, but they tended to try and discover Neoplatonic doctrines even in the Aristotelian logical texts. In the case of the Categories, they even imagined that Aristotle had taken his doctrine from a Pythagorean writer, Archytas, and that there was an underlying and wildly metaphysical strand to the text which it was the commentator's duty to uncover. Boethius, however, although making occasional use of later commentaries, usually followed Porphyry: on the Categories he stayed close to Porphyry's surviving (and quite simple) question-and-answer commentary, whilst the long, second commentary on On Interpretation is commonly accepted as the best guide to Porphyry's exegesis, since his own commentary does not survive. Boethius's commentaries were, therefore, because more Porphyrian, so more Aristotelian than what was being written in Greek in his period.

Boethius's Porphyrian approach is evident even in the two commentaries on Porphyry's own Isagoge (an introduction to the Categories which had become accepted as a standard part of the logical curriculum)—one text on which, obviously, Porphyry himself had never commented. Near the beginning of the Isagoge, Porphyry mentions, but declines in an introductory work to discuss, three questions about universals. Do they exist or are they mere concepts? If they exist are they bodily or not, and, if they are not, are they separated from sensible things or do they exist in them? By Boethius's time, the Greek commentators had developed a standard way of glossing this passage. They explained that universals could be considered as concepts (universals post rem—‘following the thing’), as intrinsic to bodily things (universals in re—‘in the thing’) and as really existing and separate from bodies (universals ante rem—‘before the thing’). Rather than proffer an explanation on these lines, Boethius turns to a train of thought (1906, 161:14 ff.) which goes back in part to Porphyry himself and, through him, to the great Aristotelian, Alexander of Aphrodisias.

Boethius begins with an argument against universals as an object of enquiry. Everything that really exists is one in number, but nothing that is common to many at the same time can be one in number. But universals are common to many at the same time. And so universals do not exist in reality, but in thought alone. Thoughts, Boethius continues, are of two sorts: those which derive from their object in the way it is (call them ‘corresponding thoughts’) and those which do not. If the thoughts that are universals were corresponding thoughts, then universals would also exist in reality. Since they do not, universals are non-corresponding thoughts, and non-corresponding thoughts are empty. Enquiry into universals (and therefore into the five predicables studied in the Isagoge) should therefore be abandoned. Boethius's way of tackling this objection is to challenge just the very final stage. Non-corresponding thoughts, he argues, are not empty if they are abstractions. Consider a mathematical object such as a line or a point, which the mathematician contemplates by abstracting from the material body of which it is part. No such thing exists in reality as an immaterial line or point, and yet the mathematician's thought is not empty or misleading. The case is similar if we disregard the accidental features of some particular thing (John Marenbon, for instance) and are left just with his nature of man. This line of reply, as Alain de Libera (1999, 159-280) has shown, goes back to Alexander of Aphrodisias or his followers. Boethius, however, goes on to give it his own particular twist, by suggesting that the universals produced by abstraction are not merely the constructions of the mind, but do grasp reality as it is. Although this line fits oddly with the argument from which Boethius set out, he may already be anticipating the Principle of Modes of Cognition, which he proposes in the Consolation (see Section 6 below).

The long, second commentary on On Interpretation is very probably based, as explained above, on Porphyry's lost commentary. It thus provides a full account of Porphyry's semantics—a semantics based on Aristotle, because he takes ordinary language to be concerned with material things rather than with the intelligible world. There is also an extended discussion of the sea-battle passage in Chapter 9. According to the principle of bivalence, ‘There will be a sea-battle tomorrow’ is either true or false. But, if it is true, then there will be a sea-battle tomorrow; if false, there will not be one. Either way, is it not therefore a matter of necessity? Boethius's strategy is to say that ‘There will be a sea-battle tomorrow’ is indeed either true or false, but, because the sea-battle is a contingent event, its truth or falsehood is only indefinite. What does this position amount to? There are various interpretations of how it should be understood. Perhaps the most plausible is that Boethius holds that, if an event e is contingent, then the sentence ‘e will take place’ is false, even if it turns out that e does in fact happen, because ‘e will take place’ implies that e will take place necessarily. But a qualified sentence such as ‘e will take place contingently’ is true just in case it is not necessary that e happens, and e actually happens.

3. The Logical Text-Books

The two most interesting of Boethius's logical text-books are the treatises on topical differentiae (c.522–3) and on hypothetical syllogisms (516–22), since each gives an insight into an area of late ancient logic for which there are otherwise few, if any, sources.

From Aristotle's Topics, logicians of late antiquity had elaborated a system of topical argument, which had been considerably influenced by the needs of Roman lawyers. The focus of topical theory is on discovering arguments, and these arguments are not usually formally valid, but merely plausible. The topical differentiae are the classifications of types of such arguments; knowing the differentiae gives the arguer a ready means to hit upon a persuasive line of reasoning. Suppose, for example, I want to argue that we should praise Cicero. I start trying to think what information I have which might help me to argue this point, and I remember that everyone is full of praises for another orator, Demosthenes. Then I turn over in my mind the list of topical differentiae and I see that the differentia ‘from equals’ will provide me with the argument I need:

  1. Everyone praises Demosthenes as an orator.
  2. Cicero is Demosthenes's equal as an orator.

Therefore

  1. Everyone should praise Cicero.

Associated with this, as with every differentia, is a ‘maximal sentence’ (maxima propositio), in this case: ‘equal things are to be judged equally.’ The maximal sentence can be taken as an indication of how to put together the argument; it might also be added to the argument in order to make it formally valid, but Boethius did not envisage maximal sentences being used in this way. Rather, the topical arguer produces arguments of differing strength, depending on how close to being a logical truth is the maximal sentence associated with the differentia he is using. Some maximal sentences do indeed state fundamental laws of reasoning (including modus ponens and modus tollens); others state what are best rules of thumb and, in the case of the topic ‘from authority’—the injunction to accept as true what the wise, or experts or the majority believe—not even that.

Boethius's two main authorities, Cicero and Themistius, give rather different lists of the topical differentiae, and one of the tasks of his text-book is to show that their schemes do really coincide. In his commentary on Cicero's Topics, written shortly before, Boethius expounds the same theory, but leaves himself plenty of room for digressions on such subjects as universals, causation, free will and Stoic logic.

It is Stoic logic and Boethius's relations to it which give his treatise On hypothetical syllogismsits special interest. A syllogism is ‘hypothetical’ when one of its premisses is a molecular sentence which uses ‘if’ or ‘or’ (understood as exclusive disjunction) as a connective. So, for example, the following syllogism is hypothetical:

  1. If it is day, it is light.
  2. It is not light.

Therefore

  1. It is not day.

A modern reader will be inclined to see (4–6) as a piece of simple sentence logic: p→q; ¬q; therefore ¬p. Since it was the Stoics who, in antiquity, developed a sentence logic, by contrast with Aristotle's term logic, it would appear that Boethius's treatise on hypothetical syllogisms is the tributary of Stoic logic. This conclusion is true to the extent that the tradition Boethius inherited goes back in part to Stoic roots. By the time it had reached Boethius, however, Stoic and Peripatetic elements had become hopelessly confused. As C.J. Martin (1991) has shown, Boethius himself lacked the conceptual apparatus to think in terms of sentence logic. For him, (4–6) is to be understood as term logic, in which the predicates ‘is light’ and ‘is day’ are attributed to or denied of a vague subject ‘it’. The treatise itself is mainly devoted to a laborious calculation of the various different possible forms of hypothetical syllogism involving two, three (with a first premise such as ‘If it is A, then if it is B, it is C’) and four terms (with a first premise such as ‘If, if it is A then it is B, then, if it is C then it is D’).

4. The Theological Treatises

The three opuscula sacra written to analyse points of Christian doctrine seem to have been occasioned by events of the time. Treatise V, against Eutyches and Nestorius, was apparently inspired by a letter (c. 513) from a group of Greek bishops, proposing a Christological formula which, they hoped, would unite the Western and Eastern Churches. The two treatises on the Trinity (II is a partial sketch for I) are related to the intervention in 519 by a group of Scythian monks, also designed to heal the schism. The works have, however, an interest far beyond their contributions to the immediate doctrinal debate. They pioneer a method of using logical analysis in a theological context which Augustine had anticipated but not developed. Both heretical positions (for examples, the views about Christ and human nature held by Eutyches and Nestorius) and orthodox Christian doctrine are subjected to rigorous scrutiny, using the techniques of Aristotelian logic and, where necessary, ideas from Aristotelian physics. The heretical ideas are shown to contain logical contradictions. As for the orthodox understanding of God, it does not fit within the classifications of Aristotelian logic and natural science, but Boethius tries to chart exactly how far these distinctions, which are accommodated to the created world, also apply to the deity, and at what point they break down and provide us merely with an analogy.

This way of thinking about God is made especially clear in the longer treatise on the Trinity (I). When God is said to have an attribute, how is this predication to be understood? For created things, on the Aristotelian scheme, a predication is either substantial (when the genus, species or differentia is predicated of something: ‘Socrates is an animal/man/rational’) or accidental, when the predicate is any accident in any of the nine Aristotelian categories of accident. Augustine had already acknowledged that nothing is predicated of God accidentally. Predications about him may be relative, as when he is called ‘Father’ or ‘Son’, or substantial. Even when a quality or quantity is attributed to him, the predication is substantial. When we say of a created thing that it is great or good, we are affirming that it participates in greatness or goodness: it is one thing for the thing to exist, another for it to be great or good. But God is greatness itself and goodness itself, and so, when we say, ‘God is good’ or ‘God is great’, we are not affirming any attribute of him beyond what he is as a substance. This Augustinian view is faithfully set out in the brief Treatise II.

In Treatise I, Boethius develops this scheme. In especial, he distinguishes between predications in the categories of Substance, Quantity and Quality, which are proper and intrinsic, and those in the other six categories, excluding Relation, which he calls improper and extrinsic. The intuitive idea behind the distinction seems to be that predications in these other categories concern only how the subject relates to other things; only substantial, quantitative and qualitative attributes mark out the particular, given thing. Boethius goes on to say that, whereas all proper, intrinsic predications about God are substantial, extrinsic, improper predications about him are not: they do not concern what either God or his creatures are, but are rather about exterior things.

The discussion of Relation shows particularly clearly how Boethius applies logic to analysing God as far as he can, and then shows where and how the logic fails. He needs to explain how it can be true that the same, one God is both the Father and the Son. He does so by claiming that a predication of Relation, such as ‘is the Father’, does not concern the substance of the things related: that a is related to b in no way changes a or b. Moreover, there are some relationships which a thing can have to itself—for example, that of equality. Being-a-father and being-a-son are not, among created things, such relations: no one can be his own father or his own son. But it is here, says Boethius, that creaturely logic breaks down when it tries to comprehend the Trinity: we have in some way to try to grasp the idea of a relation of fatherhood or filiation which is reflexive.

Treatise III is also concerned with predication and God. But it differs sharply from the other treatises, in that it contains nothing specifically Christian. The question it addresses is how all substances are good in that they are, and yet are not substantial goods. Boethius takes it as a fundamental truth that all things tend to the good, and also that things are by nature like what they desire. Everything, therefore, is by nature good. But if so, then things must be good either by participation, or substantially (or ‘essentially’ as a modern philosopher would say). If they were merely good by participation, they would be good by accident, not by nature. But if they are good substantially, then their substance is goodness itself, and so nothing can be distinguished from the first good, God. In giving his answer, Boethius makes use of a set of axioms he states at the beginning of the piece, and undertakes a thought-experiment in which it is supposed per impossibile that God does not exist. The key to his solution lies in finding a principled way to distinguish between a thing a being F in that it exists, and a thing a being substantially F. For a to be substantially F means, Boethius's discussion implies, that ‘a is not-F’ is inconceivable (we might say ‘logically impossible’). For a to be F in that it exists means just that ‘ais not-F’ is impossible (we might say ‘impossible given the way the world is set up’). Whereas it is inconceivable that God is not good, it is merely impossible that everything is not good.

5. The Consolation of Philosophy: The Argument of Books I–V.2

The Consolation of Philosophy presents interpretative difficulties of a different order from the logical works or the theological treatises. Unlike them, it is written in an elaborately literary form: it consists of a dialogue between Boethius, sitting in his prison-cell awaiting execution, and a lady who personifies Philosophy, and its often highly rhetorical prose is interspersed with verse passages. Moreover, although it is true that elsewhere Boethius does not write in a way which identifies him as a Christian except in the Theological Treatises I, II, IV and V, the absence of any explicit reference to Christianity in the Consolation poses a special problem, when it is recalled that it is the work of a man about to face death and so very literally composing his philosophical and literary testament. These questions will appear in sharper focus (Section 7) when the argument of the Consolation has been examined.

Boethius's real predicament sets the scene for the argument of the Consolation. He represents himself as utterly confused and dejected by his sudden change of fortune. Philosophy's first job—true to the generic aim of a consolatio—is to console, not by offering sympathy, but by showing that Boethius has no good reason to complain: true happiness, she wishes to argue, is not damaged even by the sort of disaster he has experienced. She also identifies in Book I a wider objective: to show that it is not the case, as Boethius the character claims, that the wicked prosper and the good are oppressed.

Philosophy seems to have two different lines of argument to show Boethius that his predicament does not exclude him from true happiness. The first train of argument rests on a complex view of the highest good. The first (which is put forward in Book II and the first part of Book III) distinguishes between the ornamental goods of fortune, which are of very limited value—riches, status, power and sensual pleasure—and the true goods: the virtues and also sufficiency, which is what those who seek riches, status and power really desire. It also recognizes some non-ornamental goods of fortune, such as a person's friends and family, as having considerable genuine value. On the basis of these distinctions, Philosophy can argue that Boethius has not lost any true goods, and that he still even retains those goods of fortune—his family—which carry much real worth. She does not maintain that, in his fall from being powerful, rich and respected to the status of a condemned prisoner, Boethius has lost nothing of any worth at all. But his loss need not cut him off from true happiness, which is attained primarily by an austere life based on sufficiency, virtue and wisdom.

Philosophy's second line of argument is based on a simple view of the highest good. She begins to put it forward in III.10, a turning-point in the discussion, which is preceded by the most solemn poem of the whole work (III m. 9), an invocation to God in terms borrowed from Plato's Timaeus. Through a number of arguments which draw out the consequences of the Neoplatonic assumptions which Boethius accepts, Philosophy shows that the perfect good and perfect happiness are not merely in God: they are God. Perfect happiness is therefore completely untouched by changes in earthly fortune, however drastic. But what this second approach fails to explain is how the individual human, such as Boethius, is supposed to relate to the perfect happiness which is God. Philosophy seems to speak as if, merely by knowing that God is perfect happiness, Boethius himself will be rendered happy, although in the next section it seems that it is by acting well that a person can attain the good.

Philosophy now goes on (III.11-12) to explain how God rules the universe. He does so by acting as a final cause. He is the good which all things desire, and so he functions as ‘a helm and rudder, by which the fabric of the world is kept stable and without decay.’ Philosophy thus pictures an entirely non-interventionist God, presiding over a universe which is well-ordered simply because he exists. But how does this account fit with the apparent oppression of the good and triumph of the wicked, about which Boethius had begun by complaining? In Book IV.1–4, Philosophy shows, drawing on Plato's Gorgias, that the evil do not really prosper and they are in fact powerless. Her central argument is that what everyone wants is happiness, and happiness is identical with the good. The good have therefore gained happiness, whereas the wicked have not; and since people have power in so far as they can gain or bring about what they want, the wicked are powerless. She also argues that the good gain their reward automatically, since by being good, they attain the good, which is happiness. By contrast, since evil is not a thing but a privation of existence, by being wicked people punish themselves, because they cease even to exist—that is to say, they stop being the sort of things they were, humans, and become other, lower animals. Philosophy is therefore able to put forward emphatically two of the most counter-intuitive claims of the Gorgias: that the wicked are happier when they are prevented from their evil and punished for it, than when they carry it out with impunity, and that those who do injustice are unhappier than those who suffer it.

At the beginning of IV.5, however, there is another change of direction. Boethius the character is allowed to put forward the obvious, common-sense objections to the position Philosophy has been taking: ‘which wise man’, he asks, ‘would prefer to be a penniless, disgraced exile rather than stay in his own city and lead there a flourishing life, mighty in wealth, revered in honour and strong in power?’ Philosophy answers by abandoning completely the explanation developed from III.11 onwards, which presented God as a non-intervening final cause, and offers instead a view of God as the efficient cause of all things. Divine providence is the unified view in God's mind of the course of events which, unfolded in time, is called ‘fate’, and everything which takes place on earth is part of God's providence. Philosophy's change of direction might seem at first to make Boethius's common-sense objection even harder to answer, but in fact it is easy enough for her to explain that apparently unjust rewards and punishments on earth always serve a good, though to us hidden, purpose: for instance, exercising good people to increase their virtue, helping the wicked to repent or, alternatively, letting them bring themselves to ruin. A less tractable problem raised by Philosophy's new approach is that it seems to imply that the human will is causally determined. Unlike many modern philosophers, Boethius did not believe that the will can remain free, in the sense needed for attribution of moral responsibility, if it is determined causally. Moreover, Philosophy insists that the causal chain of providence, as worked out in fate, embraces all that happens. In V.1, when Boethius asks about chance, Philosophy explains that events are said to happen by chance when they are the result of a chain of causes which is unintended or unexpected, as when someone is digging in a field for vegetables and finds a buried treasure. Philosophy's solution is to argue (V.2) that rational acts of volition, unlike all external events, do not themselves belong to the causal chain of fate. This freedom, however, is enjoyed only by ‘the divine and supernal substances’ and by human beings engaged in the contemplation of God. It is reduced and lost as humans give their attentions to worldly things and allow themselves to be swayed by the passions.

6. Divine Prescience, Contingency and Eternity

In V.3, however, the character Boethius puts forward an argument, based on God's foreknowledge of future events, which threatens to show that even mental acts of willing are determined and so (as Boethius the author believed) unfree. He proposes the argument in two formulations:

  1. If God sees all things and can in no way be mistaken, then there necessarily happens what he by providence will have foreseen will be.
  2. If things are capable of turning out differently from how they have been foreseen, then there will no longer be firm foreknowledge of the future, but rather uncertain opinion.

Since it is accepted that God is omniscient, and that this implies that he knows what every future event—including mental events such as volitions—will be, (7) and (8) each seem to rule out any sort of freedom of the will requisite for attributing moral responsibility: a consequence the disastrous implications of which Boethius the character vividly describes.

Philosophy's answer to this difficulty is the most philosophically intricate and interesting section of the Consolation. It is one part of Boethius's work (perhaps the only one) which remains of interest in contemporary philosophy (of religion) and, for that reason, it has often been interpreted according to a framework provided by more recent thinking about the problem of divine prescience (see, for example, Leftow (1991), Zagzebski (1991)). The following is, rather, an attempt to present the discussion as it actually proceeds in the Consolation.

The first point which needs to be settled is what, precisely, is the problem which Boethius the character proposes? The reasoning behind (7) seems to be of the following form:

  1. God knows every event, including all future ones.
  2. When someone knows that an event will happen, then the event will happen.
  3. (10) is true as a matter of necessity, because it is impossible to know that which is not the case.
  4. If someone knows an event will happen, it will happen necessarily.(10, 11)
  5. Every event, including future ones, happens necessarily. (9, 12)

The pattern behind (8) will be similar, but in reverse: from a negation of (13), the negation of (9) will be seen to follow. But, as it is easy to observe, (9–13) is a fallacious argument: (10) and (11) imply, not (12), but

  1. Necessarily, if someone knows an event will happen, it will happen.

The fallacy, therefore, concerns the scope of the necessity operator. Boethius has mistakenly inferred the (narrow-scope) necessity of the consequent (‘the event will happen’), when he is entitled only to infer the (wide-scope) necessity of the whole conditional (‘if someone knows an event will happen, it will happen’). Boethius the character is clearly taken in by this fallacious argument, and there is no good reason to think that Boethius the author ever became aware of the fallacy (despite a passage later on which some modern commentators have interpreted in this sense). None the less, the discussion which follows does not, as the danger seems to be, address itself to a non-problem. Intuitively, Boethius sees that the threat which divine prescience poses to the contingency of future events arises not just from the claim that God's beliefs about the future constitute knowledge, but also from the fact that they are beliefs about the future. There is a real problem here, because if God knows now what I shall do tomorrow, then it seems that either what I shall do is already determined, or else that I shall have the power tomorrow to convert God's knowledge today into a false belief. Although his logical formulation does not capture this problem, the solution Boethius gives to Philosophy is clearly designed to tackle it.

Philosophy identifies (V.4) the character Boethius's central difficulty as lying in the apparent incompatibility between an event's not having a necessary outcome and yet its being foreknown. To foresee something ‘as if it were certain’ when it is uncertain how it will turn out is ‘foreign to the integrity of knowledge’, since it involves ‘judging a thing as being other than it is.’ Philosophy counters these doubts with the principle that ‘everything that is known is grasped, not according to its own power, but rather according to the capacity of those who know it.’ Her view, as she develops it (in V.5 and V.6), is based on what might be called the Principle of Modes of Cognition: the idea that knowledge is always relativized to different levels of knowers, who have different sorts of objects of knowledge. Although she initially develops this scheme in a complex way, in relation to the different levels of the soul (intelligence, reason, imagination and the senses) and their different objects (pure Form, abstract universals, images, particular bodily things), for most of her discussion Philosophy concentrates on a rather simpler aspect of it. God's way of being and knowing, she argues, is eternal, and divine eternity, she says, is not the same as just lacking a beginning and end, but it is rather (V.6) ‘the whole, simultaneous and perfect possession of unbounded life.’

A being who is eternal in this way, Philosophy argues, knows all things—past, present and future—in the same way as we, who live in time and not eternity, know what is present. She then goes on to show why, so long as God knows future events by their being present to him, this knowledge is compatible with the events’ not being determined. There are, she explains, two sorts of necessity: simple and conditional. Simple necessities are what would now be called physical or nomic necessities: that the sun rises, or that a man will sometime die. By contrast, it is conditionally necessary that, for instance, I am walking, when I am walking (or when someone sees that I am walking); but from this conditional necessity it does not follow that it is simply necessary that I am walking. Although a number of modern commentators interpret this passage as Philosophy's way of noticing the scope-distinction fallacy in the original way Boethius the character presents the problem, she really seems to be making a rather different point. On an Aristotelian understanding of modality, which Boethius the author accepted, the present is necessary: ‘what is, necessarily is, when it is’ (On Interpretation 19a23). Philosophy is arguing that, since God knows all things as if they were present, future events are necessary, in relation to their being known by God, in just the way that anything which is presently the case is necessary. And this necessity of the present is an unconstraining necessity—those who accepted Aristotelian modalities did not think that because, when I am sitting, I am sitting necessarily, my freedom to stand has been at all curtailed. Indeed, as Philosophy stresses, in themselves the future events remain completely free. Philosophy is thus able to explain how, as known by God, future contingent events have the certainty which make them proper objects of knowledge, rather than opinion, whilst nevertheless retaining their indeterminacy.

It is important to add, however, that most contemporary interpreters do not read the argument of V.3–6 in quite this way. They hold that Philosophy is arguing that God is atemporal, so eliminating the problems about determinism, which arise when God's knowing future contingents is seen an event in the past, and therefore, fixed.

However it is interpreted, Philosophy's argument takes a surprising turn at the very end of the book. When he gave his initial statement of the problem, Boethius the character had distinguished the problem at issue—that of divine prescience—from that of divine predetermination. He had explained (V.3) that, for the purposes of their discussion, he was assuming that God does not cause the events he foreknows: he knows them because they happen, rather than their happening because he foreknows them. He added, though, in passing, that he did not really accept this view: it is ‘back to front’ to think that ‘the outcome of things in time should be the cause of eternal prescience.’ Philosophy now returns to this point, conceding that God's act of knowing ‘sets the measure for all things and owes nothing to things which follow on from it.’ Although Philosophy considers that she has successfully resolved the character Boethius's problems, the reader is left asking whether this final concession, which makes God the determiner of all events, does not ruin the elaborate defence of the contingency of human volitions she has just been mounting.

7. Interpreting the Consolation

One, perfectly plausible way of reading the Consolation is to take it, as most philosophical works are taken, at face value. On this reading, Philosophy is recognized as a clearly authoritative figure, whose teaching should not be doubted and whose success in consoling the character Boethius must be assumed to be complete. The apparent changes of direction noted in Section 5 will be taken either as stages in Boethius's re-education or as unintended effects of the author's wish to make this work into a compendium of a syncretistic philosophical system, and Philosophy's own view that she has resolved the problem of prescience will be accepted as that of Boethius the author.

Yet there are a number of reasons which suggest that Boethius's intention as an author was more complex. First, it would have been hard for his intended audience of educated Christians to ignore the fact that in this dialogue a Christian, Boethius, is being instructed by a figure who clearly represents the tradition of pagan Philosophy, and who proposes some positions (on the World Soul in III m.9, and on the sempiternity of the world in V.6) which most Christians would have found dubious. Boethius the character says nothing which is explicitly Christian, but when in III.12 Philosophy says, echoing the words of Wisdom viii, 1 that ‘it is the highest good that rules all things strongly and disposes them sweetly’, he expresses his delight not just in what she has said but much more ‘in those very words’ that she uses—a broad hint to the reader that he remembers his Christian identity even in the midst of his philosophical instruction.

Second, the genre Boethius chose for the Consolation, that of the prosimetrum or Menippean satire, was associated with works which ridicule the pretensions of authoritative claims to wisdom. Elements of satire on the claims of learning are present even in the vast, encyclopaedic Marriage of Mercury and Philology by the fifth-century author Martianus Capella, which Boethius clearly knew. Ancient authors thought carefully about genres, and it is hard to think that Boethius's choice was not a hint that Philosophy's authority is not to be taken as complete. And, third, in the light of these two considerations, the changes of direction, incoherencies and ultimate failure of the long argument about prescience, when the question is suddenly recast as one about predestination, all suggest themselves as intentional features, for which the interpreter must account.

Some recent interpreters, such as Joel Relihan (1993, 187-194), have gone so far as to suggest that the Consolation should be understood ironically as an account of the insufficiency of Philosophy (and philosophy) to provide consolation, by contrast with Christian faith. Such a view seems too extreme, because Boethius the author has clearly taken great pains with the philosophical arguments proposed in the text, and the main lines of Philosophy's thinking fit well with the metaphysics glimpsed in the theological tractates and even, at moments, in the logical commentaries. It is plausible, however, to hold that Boethius wished, whilst acknowledging the value of philosophy—to which he had devoted his life, and for which he presented himself as being about to die—to point its limitations: limitations which Philosophy herself, who is keen to emphasize that she is not divine, accepts. Philosophy, he might be suggesting, provides arguments and solutions to problems which should be accepted and it teaches a way of living that should be followed, but it falls short of providing a coherent and comprehensive understanding of God and his relation to creatures. Boethius the character should be satisfied, but not completely satisfied, by Philosophy's argument. And if this is Boethius the author's position in the Consolation, then it fits closely with the theological method he pioneered in the opuscula sacra.

8. Boethius's Influence and Importance

The influence of each area of Boethius's philosophical writing was vast in the Middle Ages. Along with Augustine and Aristotle, he is the fundamental philosophical and theological author in the Latin tradition.

In logic, Boethius's translations of Aristotle and Porphyry (except for that of the Posterior Analytics, which was lost) remained standard throughout the Middle Ages. His commentaries—especially that on the Categories, the second commentary on the Isagoge and the second, more advanced commentary on On Interpretation—were the main instruments by which logicians from the ninth to the twelfth centuries came to understand the Aristotelian texts he had translated, and to grapple with their problems and the wider range of related philosophical issues raised by the late ancient tradition. Even twelfth-century philosophers as independently-minded as Abelard and Gilbert of Poitiers were deeply indebted to these commentaries. The logical text-books were equally important. Before the Prior Analytics became generally available in the later twelfth century, students learned syllogistic from Boethius's monographs on it. The theory of topical argument, acquired especially from On Topical Differentiae, provided a framework for twelfth-century philosophers in propounding and analysing arguments, and from the combination of studying topical argument and the theory of hypothetical syllogisms as Boethius presented it, Abelard was led towards his rediscovery of sentence logic (cf. Martin (1987)). From the thirteenth century, onwards, however, both Boethius's commentaries and his treatises became less influential, although some of these works were still read.

The theological treatises were probably already known by the pupils of Alcuin at the court of Charlemagne around 800, and a tradition of glosses to the text probably goes back to the School of Auxerre in the later ninth century. The opuscula sacra provided a model for early medieval thinkers who wanted to use their logical training in thinking about Christian doctrine. Anselm was certainly aware of them, though he looked more closely to Augustine; Abelard's first theological work, the Theologia Summi Boni, despite its originality, is clearly inspired by Boethius's first treatise (on the Trinity). In the 1140s, Gilbert of Poitiers expounded his metaphysics and his view of theology in a detailed exegesis the opuscula sacra, which came to be the standard commentary, although the treatises were also commented on by other, more Platonically-minded twelfth-century scholars. Although the opuscula sacra were not formally a part of the theology curriculum in most later medieval universities, they continued to be studied, and Aquinas wrote commentaries on Treatises I and III.

Great though the influence of these other works, the popularity and importance of the Consolation far exceeded it. The text already echoes in what must be one of the earliest pieces of genuinely medieval Latin philosophy, the little treatise ‘On True Philosophy' with which Alcuin prefaced his De grammatica, and it remained a favourite through the later Middle Ages and into the Renaissance. Not until the time of Gibbon had it been reduced to an object of the historian's condescending admiration. One measure of the extent and character of its readership is the translations, not merely into almost every medieval vernacular, but also into Greek and even Hebrew. Among the translators were two of the greatest vernacular writers of the whole epoch: Jean de Meun, who put the Consolation into Old French in the later thirteenth century, and Chaucer, who translated it into Middle English about a century later. As their involvement suggests, Boethius's dialogue was a text which popularized philosophy outside the universities, and its literary features, as well as its arguments, inspired imitations and creative adaptations, from Alain of Lille's De planctu Naturae(‘Nature's Lament’) to, more distantly, Dante's Convivio and even Chaucer's Troilus and Criseyde. Philosophers and theologians, too, used the work; it was part of the school syllabus from the ninth to the twelfth centuries, and although Aristotle's treatises left no room for it in the university curriculum, it continued to be studied by students and teachers there. For example, Aquinas's account of the highest good in his Summa Theologiae IaIIe builds on the Consolation, and the definition of eternity given by Philosophy in Book V became the starting-point for almost every later medieval discussion of God and time.

The Consolation had many medieval commentaries—mostly on the whole text, although some just examined Book III, m. 9. In the tenth and eleventh centuries, the commentary written by Remigius of Auxerre was the most widely read (and often adapted). William of Conches's commentary, written in the 1120s, became standard in the twelfth and thirteenth centuries and the commentary by the English Dominican, Nicholas Trivet, from the beginning of the fourteenth century, was the most popular in the late Middle Ages. One of the central problems which faced any commentator was the relation of the text to Christian teaching. Remigius and, in a subtler way, William both took Boethius, whom they knew to be a Christian, to be putting forward Christian doctrine without seeming to do so; Trivet's approach is less syncretistic, although he finds nothing unacceptable for Christians in the Consolation.

The preceding paragraphs in this section might seem to indicate that there is no doubt about Boethius's importance as a philosopher. Yet the very size of his medieval influence has led to an attitude, widespread among historians of philosophy (see especially Courcelle (1967)), which makes Boethius almost disappear as a figure in his own right. He is seen, rather, as a conduit through which Greek philosophical ideas were transmitted to the Latin tradition. Of course, one aspect of Boethius's influence is indeed that he made available ideas and arguments deriving from Plato, Aristotle, Alexander of Aphrodisias, Porphyry and Iamblichus. But he was also an individual thinker, with pronounced tastes and views, no less (if no more) original than his Greek contemporaries; and also, in the Consolation, one of the rare philosophers whose thought, like Plato's, cannot be neatly separated from the complex literary form in which it is expressed.

Bibliography

Primary Texts in Latin

Selected English Translations of Primary Texts

Selected Secondary Works

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Related Entries

Alexander of Aphrodisias | Augustine, Saint | free will | free will: divine foreknowledge and | medieval philosophy | medieval philosophy: literary forms of | modality: medieval theories of | syllogism: medieval theories of | universals: the medieval problem of