Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy
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Rule Consequentialism

First published Wed Dec 31, 2003; substantive revision Wed Jan 9, 2008

The theory of morality we can call full rule-consequentialism selects rules solely in terms of the goodness of their consequences and then claims that these rules determine which kinds of acts are morally wrong. George Berkeley was arguably the first rule-consequentialist. He wrote, “In framing the general laws of nature, it is granted we must be entirely guided by the public good of mankind, but not in the ordinary moral actions of our lives. … The rule is framed with respect to the good of mankind; but our practice must be always shaped immediately by the rule.” (Berkeley 1712, section 31) Writers often classed as rule-consequentialists include Austin 1832; Harrod 1936; Toulmin 1950; Urmson 1953; Harrison 1953; Mabbott 1953; Singer 1955; 1961; and most prominently Brandt 1959; 1963; 1967; 1979; 1989; 1996; and Harsanyi 1977; 1982; 1993. See also Rawls 1955; Hospers 1972; Haslett 1987; 1994, ch. 1; 2000; Attfield 1987, 103-12; Barrow 1991, ch. 6; Johnson 1991; Riley 1998; 2000; Shaw 1999; and Hooker 2000. Whether J. S. Mill's ethics was rule-consequentialist is controversial (Urmson 1953; Crisp 1997, 102-33).

1. Utilitarianism

A moral theory is a form of consequentialism if and only if it assesses acts and/or character traits, practices, and institutions solely in terms of the goodness of the consequences. Historically, utilitarianism has been the best-known form of consequentialism. Utilitarianism assesses acts and/or character traits, practices, and institutions solely in terms of overall net benefit, which is often referred to as well-being or welfare. Overall welfare is calculated by counting a benefit or harm to any one individual the same as the same size benefit or harm to any other individual, and then adding all the benefits and harms together to reach an aggregate sum. There is considerable dispute among consequentialists about what the best account of welfare is.

2. Welfare

Classical utitilitarians (i.e., Jeremy Bentham, J. S. Mill, and Henry Sidgwick) took benefit and harm to be purely a matter of pleasure and pain. The view that welfare is a matter of pleasure minus pain has generally been called hedonism. It has grown in sophistication (Parfit 1984, Appendix I; Sumner 1996) but remains committed to the thesis that how well someone's life goes depends entirely on his or her pleasure minus pain, albeit with pleasure and pain being construed very broadly.

Even if pleasures and pains are construed very broadly, hedonism encounters difficulties. The main one is that many (if not all) people care very strongly about things other than their own pleasures and pains. Of course these other things can be important as means to pleasures and to the avoidance of pain. But many people care very strongly about things over and beyond their hedonistic instrumental value. For example, many people want to know the truth about various matters even if this won't increase their (or anyone else's) pleasure. Another example is that many people care about achieving things over and beyond the pleasure such achievements might produce. Again, many people care about the welfare of their family and friends in a non-instrumental way. A rival account of these points, especially the last, is that people care about many things other than their own welfare.

On any plausible view of welfare, the satisfaction people can feel when their desires are fulfilled constitutes an addition to their welfare. Likewise, on any plausible view, frustration felt as a result of unfulfilled desires constitutes a reduction in welfare. What is controversial is whether the fulfilment of someone's desire constitutes a benefit to that person apart from any effect that the fulfilment of the desire has on that person's felt satisfaction or frustration. Hedonism answers No, claiming that only effects on felt satisfaction or felt frustration matter.

A different theory of welfare answers Yes. This theory holds that the fulfilment of any desire of the agent's constitutes a benefit to the agent, even if the agent never knows that desire has been fulfilled and even if the agent derives no pleasure from its fulfilment. This theory of human welfare is often referred to as the desire-fulfillment theory of welfare. In the twentieth century, most of those sympathetic to utilitarianism replaced hedonism with the desire-fulfilment theory.

Clearly, the desire-fulfillment theory of welfare is broader than hedonism, in that the desire-fulfillment theory accepts that what can constitute a benefit is wider than merely pleasure. But there are reasons for thinking that this broader theory is too broad.

For one thing, people can have sensible desires that are simply too disconnected from their own lives to be relevant to their own welfare (Williams 1973, 262; Overvold 1980, 1982; Parfit 1984, 494). I desire that the starving in far-away countries get food. But the fulfilment of this desire of mine does not benefit me.

For another thing, people can have desires for absurd things for themselves. Suppose I desire to count all the blades of grass in the lawns on this road. If I get satisfaction out of doing this, the felt satisfaction constitutes a benefit to me. But the bare fulfilment of my desire to count all the blades of grass in the lawns on this road does not (Rawls 1971, 432; Parfit 1984, 500; Crisp 1997, 56).

On careful reflection, we might think that the fulfilment of someone's desire constitutes an addition to that person's welfare only if that desire has one of a certain set of contents. We might think, for example, that the fulfilment of someone's desire for pleasure, friendship, knowledge, achievement, or autonomy for herself does constitute an addition to her welfare, and that the fulfilment of any desires she might have for others things do not directly benefit her (though, again, the pleasure she derives from their satisfaction does). If we think this, it seems we think there is a list of things that constitute anyone's welfare (Parfit 1984, Appendix I; Brink 1989, 221-36; Griffin 1996, ch. 2; Crisp 1997, ch. 3; Gert 1998, 92-4; Arneson 1999a).

Insofar as the goods to be promoted are parts of welfare, the theory remains utilitarian. There is a lot to be said for utilitarianism. Obviously, how lives go is important. And there is something deeply attractive (if not downright irresistible) in the idea that morality is fundamentally impartial, i.e., the idea that, at the most fundamental level of morality, everyone is equally important — women and men, strong and weak, rich and poor, Blacks, Whites, Hispanics, Asians, etc. And utilitarianism plausibly interprets this equal importance as dictating that in the calculation of overall welfare a benefit or harm to any one individual counts neither more nor less that the same size benefit or harm to any other individual.

3. Other Goods To Be Promoted

The nonutilitarian members of the consequentialist family are theories that assess acts and/or character traits, practices, and institutions solely in terms of resulting good, where good is not restricted to welfare. “Nonutilitarian” here means “not purely utilitarian”, rather than “completely unutilitarian”. When writers describe themselves as consequentialists rather than as utilitarians, they are normally signalling that their fundamental evaluations will be in terms of not only welfare but also some other goods.

What are these other goods? The most common answers have been justice, fairness, and equality.

Justice, according to Plato, is “rendering to each his due” (Republic, Bk. 1). We might suppose that what people are due is a matter of what people are owed, either because they deserve it, or because they were promised it, or because they simply have a moral right to it. Suppose we plug these ideas into consequentialism. Then we get the theory that things should be assessed solely in terms of resulting welfare and in terms of the extent to which people get what they deserve, what they were promised, and what they have a right to.

For consequentialism to take this line, however, is for it to restrict its explanatory ambitions. What a theory simply presupposes, it does not explain. A consequentialist theory that presupposes both that justice is constituted by such-and-such and that justice is one of the things to be promoted does not explain why the components of justice are important. It does not explain what desert is. It does not explain the importance of promises and the prerequisites for them to be binding. It does not explain the importance of moral rights, much less try to determine what the contents of these moral rights are. These are matters too important and contentious for a consequentialist theory to leave unexplained or open. If consequentialism is going to refer to justice, desert, and moral rights, it needs to analyze these concepts and justify the role it gives them.

Similar things can be said about fairness. If a consequentialist theory presupposes an account of fairness, and simply stipulates that fairness is to be promoted, then this consequentialist theory is not explaining fairness. But fairness (like justice, desert, promises, and moral rights) is a concept too important for consequentialism not to try to explain.

One way for consequentialists to deal with justice and fairness is to contend that justice and fairness are constituted by conformity with a certain set of justified social practices, and that what justifies these practices is that they generally promote overall welfare and equality. Indeed, the contention might be that what people are due, what people have a moral right to, what justice and fairness require, is conformity to whatever practices promote overall welfare and equality.

Whether equality needs to be included in the formula, however, is very controversial. Many think that a purely utilitarian formula has sufficiently egalitarian implications. They think that, even if the goal is promotion of welfare, not the promotion of welfare-plus-equality, there are some contingent but pervasive facts about human beings that push in the direction of equal distribution of material resources (Brandt 1979).

According to the “law of diminishing marginal utility of material resources”, the amount of benefit a person gets out of a certain unit of material resources is less the more units of that material good the person already has. Suppose I go from having no way of getting around except by foot to having a bicycle, or if I go from having no warm coat to having one. I will benefit more from getting that first bicycle or coat than I would if I go from having nine bicycles or coats to having ten.

There are exceptions to the law of diminishing marginal utility. Most of these are cases where an additional unit of material resource pushes someone over some important threshold. For example, consider the meal or pill or gulp of air that saves someone's life, or the car whose acquisition pushes the competitive collector into first place. In such cases, the unit that puts the person over the threshold is surely as beneficial to that person as any prior unit was. Still, as a general rule, material resources do have diminishing marginal utility.

To the assumption that material resources have diminishing marginal utility, let us add the assumption that different people generally get roughly the same benefits from the same material resources. Again, there are exceptions. If you live in a freezing climate and I live in a hot climate, then you would benefit much more from a warm coat than I would.

But suppose we live in the same place, which has freezing winters, good paths for riding bicycles, and no public transportation. And suppose you have ten bicycles and ten coats (though you are not vying for some bicycle- or coat-collector prize). Meanwhile, I am so poor that I have none. Then, redistributing one of your bicycles and one of your coats to me will probably harm you less than it will benefit me. This sort of phenomenon pervades societies where resources are unequally distributed. Wherever the phenomenon occurs, a fundamentally impartial morality is under pressure to redistribute resources from the richer to the poorer.

It is a familiar truth of everyday life that greater wealth for an individual is no guarantee of greater welfare for that individual. It is also true that a society with greater overall wealth divided by the number of people in the society (roughly, higher per capita GDP) may not be better off in utilitarian terms than a society with less overall wealth divided by the number of its people (roughly, lower per capita GDP). Often the reason that the richer society does not contain greater overall welfare is that its resources are very unequally distributed and the worse off lack the resources for basic needs such as food, shelter, health care, and education.

However, there are also contingent but pervasive facts about human beings that pull in favor of practices that have the foreseen consequence of material inequality. First of all, higher levels of overall welfare can require higher levels of productivity (think of the welfare gains resulting from improvements in agricultural productivity). In many areas of the economy, the provision of material rewards for greater productivity seems the most efficient acceptable way of eliciting higher productivity. Some individuals and groups will be more productive than others (especially if there are incentive schemes). So the practice of providing material rewards for greater productivity will result in material inequality.

Thus, on the one hand, the diminishing marginal utility of material resources exerts pressure in favor of more equal distributions of resources. On the other hand, the need to promote productivity exerts pressure in favor of incentive schemes that have the foreseen consequence of material inequality. Utilitarians and most other consequentialists find themselves balancing these opposed pressures.

Note that those pressures concern the distribution of resources. There is a further question about how equally welfare itself should be distributed. Many recent writers have taken utilitarianism to be indifferent about the distribution of welfare. Imagine a choice between an outcome where overall welfare is large but distributed unequally and an outcome where overall welfare is smaller but distributed equally. Utilitarians are taken to favor outcomes with greater overall welfare even if it is also less equally distributed.

To illustrate this, let us take an artificially simple population, divided into just two groups.

Units of welfare Total welfare for both groups
Alternative 1 Per person Per group
10,000 people in group A 1 10,000
100,000 people in group B 10 1,000,000
Impartially calculated: 1,010,000
Units of welfare Total welfare for both groups
Alternative 2 Per person Per group
10,000 people in group A 8 80,000
100,000 people in group B 9 900,000
Impartially calculated: 980,000   

Many people would think Alternative 2 above better than Alternative 1, and might think that the comparison between these alternatives shows that there is always pressure in favor of greater equality of welfare.

As Derek Parfit (1997) in particular has argued, however, we must not be too hasty. Consider the following choice:

Units of welfare Total welfare for both groups
Alternative 1 Per person Per group
10,000 people in group A 1 10,000
100,000 people in group B 10 1,000,000
Impartially calculated: 1,010,000
Units of welfare Total welfare for both groups
Alternative 3 Per person Per group
10,000 people in group A 1 10,000
100,000 people in group B 1 100,000   
Impartially calculated: 110,000   

Is equality of welfare so important that Alternative 3 is superior to Alternative 1? To take an example of Parfit's, suppose the only way to make everyone equal with respect to sight is to make everyone totally blind. Is such “levelling down” required by morality? Indeed, is it in any way at all morally desirable?

If we think the answer is No, then we might think that equality of welfare as such is not really an ideal (cf. Temkin 1993). Losses to the better off are justified only where this benefits the worse off. What we had thought of as pressure in favor of equality of welfare was instead pressure in favor of levelling up. We might say that additions to welfare matter more the worse off the person is whose welfare is affected. This view has come to be called prioritarianism (Parfit 1997; Arneson 1999b). It has tremendous intuitive appeal.

For a simplistic example of how prioritarianism might work, suppose the welfare of the worst off counts five times as much as the welfare of the better off. Then Alternative 1 from the tables above comes out at (1 x 5 x 10,000) + (10 x 100,000), which comes to 1,050,000 total units of welfare. Again with the welfare of the worst off counting five times as much, Alternative 2 comes out at (8 x 5 x 10,000) + (9 x 100,000), which comes to 1,300,000 total units of welfare. This accords with the common reaction that Alternative 2 is morally superior to Alternative 1.

Of course in real examples there is never only one division in society. Rather there is a scale from the worst off, to the not quite so badly off, and so on up to the best off. Prioritarianism is committed to variable levels of importance of the welfare of people at different places on this scale: the worse off a person is, the greater the importance attached to that person's level of welfare.

This raises two serious worries about prioritarianism. The first concerns prioritarianism's difficulty in nonarbitrarily determining how much more importance to give to the welfare of the worse off. For example, should a unit of benefit to the worst off count 10 times the same size benefit to the best off and 5 times the same size benefit to the averagely well off? Or should the multipliers be 20 and 10, or 4 and 2? The second worry about prioritarianism is whether attaching greater importance to increases in welfare for some than to the same size increases in welfare for others contradicts fundamental impartiality (Hooker 2000, 60-2).

Nevertheless, prioritarianism has tremendous intuitive appeal. Utilitarianism seems to get the wrong answer in the choice between Alternative 1 and Alternative 2 in the tables above. Strict egalitarianism gets the wrong answer in the choice between Alternative 1 and Alternative 3. Prioritarianism has thus become the dominant form of consequentialism. The rest of this article, however, puts aside the debate between prioritarian and utilitarian forms of consequentialism.

4. Full versus Partial Rule-consequentialism

Consequentialists have distinguished three components of their theory: (1) their thesis about what makes acts morally wrong, (2) their thesis about the procedure agents should use to make their moral decisions, and (3) their thesis about the conditions under which moral sanctions such as blame, guilt, and praise are appropriate.

What we might call full rule-consequentialism consists of rule-consequentialist criteria for all three. Thus, full rule-consequentialism claims that an act is morally wrong if and only if it is forbidden by rules justified by their consequences. It also claims that agents should do their moral decision-making in terms of rules justified by their consequences. And it claims that the conditions under which moral sanctions should be applied are determined by rules justified by their consequences.

Full rule-consequentialists may think that there is really only one set of rules about these three different subject matters. Or they may think that there are different sets that in some sense correspond to or complement one another.

Much more important than the distinction between different kinds of full rule-consequentialism is the distinction between full rule-consequentialism and partial rule-consequentialism. Partial rule-consequentialism might take many forms. Let us focus on the most common form. The most common form of partial rule-consequentialism claims that agents should make their moral decisions about what to do by reference to rules justified by their consequences, but does not claim that moral wrongness is determined by rules justified by their consequences. Partial rule-consequentialists typically subscribe to the theory that moral wrongness is determined directly in terms of the consequences of the act. This theory of wrongness is called act-consequentialism.

Distinguishing between full and partial rule-consequentialism clarifies the contrast between act-consequentialism and rule-consequentialism. Act-consequentialism is best conceived of as maintaining merely the following:

Act-consequentialist criterion of wrongness: An act is wrong if and only if it results in less good than would have resulted from some available alternative act.

When confronted with that criterion of moral wrongness, many people naturally assume that the way to decide what to do is to apply the criterion, i.e.,

Act-consequentialist moral decision procedure: On each occasion, an agent should decide what to do by calculating which act would produce the most good.

However, no serious philosopher nowadays defends this decision procedure (Mill 1861, ch 2; Sidgwick 1907, pp. 405-6, 413, 489-90; Moore 1903, 162-4; Smart 1956, p. 346; 1973, pp. 43, 71; Bales 1971, pp. 257-65; Hare 1981; Parfit 1984, pp. 24-9, 31-43; Railton 1984, pp. 140-6, 152-3; Brink 1989, pp. 216-7, 256-62, 274-6; Pettit and Brennan 1986; Pettit 1991; 1994; 1997, 99102, 156-61). There are a number of compelling consequentialist reasons why the act-consequentialist decision procedure would be counter-productive.

First, very often the agent does not have detailed information about what the consequences would be of various acts.

Second, obtaining such information would often involve greater costs than are at stake in the decision to be made.

Third, even if the agent had the information needed to make calculations, the agent might make mistakes in the calculations. (This is especially likely when the agent's natural biases intrude, or when the calculations are complex, or when they have to be made in a hurry.)

Fourth, there are what we might call expectation effects. Imagine a society in which people know that others are naturally biased towards themselves and towards their loved ones but are trying to make their every moral decision by calculating overall good. In such a society, each person might well fear that others will go around breaking promises, stealing, lying, and even assaulting whenever they convinced themselves that such acts would produce the greatest overall good. In such a society, people would not feel they could trust one another.

This fourth consideration is more controversial than the first three. For example, Hodgson 1967, Hospers 1972, and Harsanyi 1982 argue that trust would break down. Singer 1972 and Lewis 1972 argue that it would not.

Nevertheless, most philosophers accept that, for all four of the reasons above, using an act-consequentialist decision procedure would not maximize the good. Hence even philosophers who espouse the act-consequentialist criterion of moral wrongness reject the act-consequentialist moral decision procedure. In its place, they typically advocate the following:

Rule-consequentialist decision procedure: At least normally, agents should decide what to do by applying rules whose acceptance will produce the best consequences, rules such as “Don't harm innocent others”, “Don't steal or vandalize others' property”, “Don't break your promises”, “Don't lie”, “Pay special attention to the needs of your family and friends”, “Do good for others generally”.

Since act-consequentialists about the criterion of wrongness typically accept this decision procedure, act-consequentialists are in fact partial rule-consequentialists.

The position just presented ignores the following distinction. The decision procedure that full rule-consequentialism endorses is the one that it would be best for society to accept. Act-consequentialism favors the decision procedure it would be best for the individual to accept. So, according to act-consequentialism, since Jack's and Jill's capacities and situations may be very different, the best decision procedures for Jack to accept may be different from the best decision procedure for Jill to accept. However, in practice act-consequentialists typically ignore for the most part such differences and endorse the above rule-consequentialist decision procedure (Hare 1981, chs. 2, 3, 8, 9, 11; Levy 2000).

When act-consequentialists endorse the above rule-consequentialist decision procedure, they acknowledge that following this decision procedure does not guarantee that we will do the act with the best consequences. Sometimes, for example, our following a decision procedure that rules out harming an innocent person will prevent us from doing that act that would produce the best consequences. Similarly, there will be some circumstances in which stealing, breaking our promises, etc., would produce the best consequences. Still, our following a decision procedure that generally rules out such acts will in the long run and on the whole produce better consequences than our trying to run consequentialist calculations on a case-by-case basis.

Because act-consequentialists are also partial rule-consequentialists, whether to classify some philosopher as an act-consequentialist or as a rule-consequentialist can be problematic. For example, G. E. Moore (1903; 1912) is sometimes classified as an act-consequentialist and sometimes as a rule-consequentialist. In fact, like so many others, including his teacher Henry Sidgwick, Moore combined an act-consequentialist criterion of moral wrongness with a rule-consequentialist procedure for deciding what to do. Moore simply went further than most in stressing the danger of departing from the rule-consequentialist decision procedure (see Shaw 2000).

5. Global Consequentialism

Some writers propose that the purest and most consistent form of consequentialism is the view that absolutely everything should be assessed by its consequences, including not only acts but also rules, motives, the imposition of sanctions, etc. Let us follow Pettit and Smith (2000) in referring to this view as global consequentialism. Kagan (2000) pictures it as multi-dimensional direct consequentialism, in that each thing is assessed directly in terms of whether its own consequences are as good as the consequences of alternatives.

How does this global consequentialism differ from what we have been calling partial rule-consequentialism? What we have been calling partial rule-consequentialism is nothing but the combination of the act-consequentialist criterion of moral wrongness with the rule-consequentialist decision procedure. So defined, partial rule-consequentialism leaves open the question of when moral sanctions are appropriate.

Some partial rule-consequentialists say that agents should be blamed and feel guilty whenever they fail to choose an act that would result in the best consequences. A much more reasonable position for a partial rule-consequentialist to take is that agents should be blamed and feel guilty whenever they choose an act that is forbidden by the rule-consequentialist decision procedure, whether or not that individual act fails to result in the best consequences. Finally, partial rule-consequentialism, as we have defined it, is compatible with the claim that whether agents should be blamed or feel guilty depends not on the wrongness of what they did, nor on whether the recommended procedure for making moral decisions would have led them to choose the act they choose, but instead solely on whether this blame or guilt will do any good. This is precisely the view of sanctions that global consequentialism takes.

One devastating objection to global consequentialism is that simultaneously applying a consequentialist criterion to acts, decision procedures, and the imposition of sanctions leads to apparent paradoxes (Crisp 1992; Streumer 2003; Lang 2004).

Suppose, on the whole and in the long run, the best decision procedure for you to accept is one that leads you to do act x now. But suppose also that in fact the act with the best consequences in this situation is not x but y. So global consequentialism tells you to use the best possible decision procedure but also not to do the act picked out by this decision procedure. That seems paradoxical.

Things get worse when we consider blame and guilt. Suppose you follow the best possible decision procedure but fail to do the act with the best consequences. Are you to be blamed? Should you feel guilty? Global consequentialism claims that you should be blamed if and only if blaming you will produce the best consequences, and that you should feel guilty if and only if this will produce the best consequences. Suppose that for some reason the best consequences would result from blaming you for following the prescribed decision procedure (and thus doing x). But surely it is paradoxical for a moral theory to call for you to be blamed although you followed the moral decision procedure mandated by the theory. Or suppose that for some reason the best consequences would result from blaming you for intentionally choosing the act with the best consequences (y). Again, surely it is paradoxical for a moral theory to call for you to be blamed although you intentionally chose the very act required by the theory.

So one problem with global consequentialism is that it creates potential gaps between what acts it claims to be required and what decision procedures it tells agents to use, and between each of these and blamelessness.

That is not the most familiar problem with global consequentialism. The most familiar problem with it is instead its act-consequentialist criterion of wrongness. According to that criterion, an act is wrong if and only if it fails to result in the greatest good. This criterion judges some acts to be not wrong which certainly seem to be wrong. It also judges some acts that seem not wrong to be wrong.

For example, consider an act of murder that results in slightly more good than any other act would have produced. According to the act-consequentialist criterion of wrongness, this act of murder is not wrong. Likewise, contrary to act-consequentialism, many other kinds of act such as assaulting, stealing, promise breaking, and lying can be wrong even when doing them would produce slightly more good than not doing them would.

Or consider someone who gives to her child, or keeps for herself, some resource of her own instead of contributing it to help some stranger who would have gained slightly more from that resource. Such an action hardly seems wrong. Yet the act-consequentialist criterion judges it to be wrong. Indeed, imagine how much self-sacrifice an averagely well-off person would have to make before her further actions satisfied the act-consequentialist criterion of wrongness. She would have to give to the point where further sacrifices from her in order to benefit others would harm her more than they would benefit the others. Thus, the act-consequentialist criterion of wrongness is often accused of being unreasonably demanding.

6. Formulating Full Rule-consequentialism

There are a number of different ways of formulating rule-consequentialism. For example, it can be formulated in terms of the good that actually results from rules or in terms of the rationally expected good of the consequences of rules. It can be formulated in terms of the consequences of compliance with rules or in terms of the wider consequences of acceptance of rules. It can be formulated in terms of the consequences of absolutely everyone's accepting the rules or in terms of their acceptance by something less than everyone. Rule-consequentialism is more plausible if formulated in some ways than it is if formulated in other ways. This is explained in the following three subsections. Questions of formulation are also relevant in the later section on old objections to rule-consequentialism.

6.1 Actual versus Expected Good

As indicated, full rule-consequentialism consists in rule-consequentialist answers to three questions. The first is, what makes acts morally wrong? The second is, what procedure should agents use to make their moral decisions? The third is, what are the conditions under which moral sanctions such as blame, guilt, and praise are appropriate?

As we have seen, the answer that full rule-consequentialists give to the question about decision procedure is the same as other kinds of consequentialist give to that question. So let us focus on the points of contrast, i.e., the other two questions. These two questions — about what makes acts wrong and about when sanctions are appropriate — are more tightly connected than sometimes realized.

Indeed, J. S. Mill, one of the fathers of consequentialism, affirmed their tight connection:

We do not call anything wrong, unless we mean to imply that a person ought to be punished in some way or other for doing it; if not by law, by the opinion of his fellow creatures; if not by opinion, by the reproaches of his own conscience. (1861, ch. 5, para. 14)

Let us assume that Mill took “ought to be punished” to be roughly the same as “blameworthy”. With this assumption in hand, we can interpret Mill as tying wrongness tightly to blameworthiness. In a moment, we can consider what follows if Mill is mistaken to affirm that wrongness is tied so tightly to blameworthiness. First, let us consider what follows if Mill is correct.

Consider the following argument, whose first premise comes from Mill:

If an act is wrong, it is blameworthy.

Surely, an agent cannot rightly be blamed for accepting and following rules that the agent could not foresee would have sub-optimal consequences. From this, we get our second premise:

If an act is blameworthy, the sub-optimal consequences of rules allowing that act must have been foreseeable.

From these two premises we get the conclusion:

So if an act is wrong, the sub-optimal consequences of rules allowing that act must have been foreseeable.

Of course, the actual consequences of accepting a set of rules may not be the same as the foreseeable consequences of accepting that set. Hence, if full rule-consequentialism claims that an act is wrong if and only if the foreseeable consequences of rules allowing that act are sub-optimal, rule-consequentialism cannot hold that an act is wrong if and only if the actual consequences of rules allowing that act will be sub-optimal.

Now suppose instead the relation between wrongness and blameworthiness is far looser than Mill suggested (cf. Sorensen 1996). That is, suppose that our criterion of wrongness can be quite different from our criterion of blameworthiness. In that case, we could hold:

Actualist rule-consequentialist criterion of wrongness: An act is wrong if and only if it is forbidden by rules the acceptance of which would actually result in the greatest good.

and

Expectablist rule-consequentialist criterion of blameworthiness: An act is blameworthy if and only if it is forbidden by the rules the acceptance of which would result in the greatest expected good.

Here is how expected good of a set of rules is calculated. The acceptance of a set of rules of course has various possible alternative outcomes. Suppose we can identify the value or disvalue of each possible outcome. Multiply the value of each possible outcome by the probability of that outcome's occurring. Take all the products of these multiplications and add them together. The resulting number is the expected good of that set of rules.

Note that expected good is not to be calculated by employing whatever crazy estimates of probabilities people might assign to possible outcomes. Rather, expected good is calculated by multiplying the value or disvalue of possible outcomes by rational or justified probability estimates.

There might be considerable scepticism about how often such calculations are possible. Where such calculations are possible, they will often be quite impressionistic and imprecise. Nevertheless, we can reasonably hope to make at least some informed judgements about the likely consequences of alternative possible rules. And we could be guided by such judgements. In contrast, which rules would actually have the very best consequences will normally be inaccessible. Hence, the expectablist rule-consequentialist criterion of blameworthiness is appealing.

Now return to the proposal that, while the criterion of blameworthiness is the expectablist rule-consequentialist one, the correct criterion of moral wrongness is the actualist rule-consequentialist one. This is the proposal that rejects Mill's move of tying moral wrongness to blameworthiness. There is a very strong objection to this proposal. What is the role and importance of moral wrongness if it is disassociated from blameworthiness?

In order to retain an obvious role and importance for moral wrongness, those committed to the expectablist rule-consequentialist criterion of blameworthiness are likely to endorse:

Simple expectablist rule-consequentialist criterion of moral wrongness: An act is morally wrong if and only if it is forbidden by the rules the acceptance of which would result in the greatest expected good.

Indeed, once we have before us the distinction between the amount of value that actually results and the rationally expected good, the full rule-consequentialist is likely to go for expectablist criteria of moral wrongness, blameworthiness, and decision procedures.

What if, as far as we can tell, no one code has greater expected value than its rivals? We will need to amend our expectablist criteria in order to accommodate this possibility:

Sophisticated expectablist rule-consequentialist criterion of moral wrongness: An act is morally wrong if and only if it is forbidden either by the rules the acceptance of which would result in the greatest expected good, or, if two or more alternative codes of rules are equally best in terms of expected good, by the one of these codes closest to conventional morality.

The argument for using closeness to conventional morality to break ties between otherwise equally promising codes begins with the observation that social change regularly has unexpected consequences. And these unexpected consequences usually seem to be negative. Furthermore, the greater the difference between a new code and the one already conventionally accepted, the greater the scope for unexpected consequences. So, as between two codes we judge to have equally high expected value, we should choose the one closest to the one we already know. (For discussion of the situation where two codes have equally high expected value and seem equally close to conventional morality, see Hooker 2000, 115.)

An implication of this is that we should make changes to the status quo where but only where these changes have greater expected value than sticking with the status quo. Rule-consequentialism manifestly has the capacity to recommend change. But it does not favor change for the sake of change.

Rule-consequentialism most definitely does need to be formulated so as to deal with ties in expected value. However, for the rest of this article, I will ignore this complication.

6.2 Compliance and Acceptance

There are other important issues of formulation that rule-consequentialists face. One is the issue of whether rule-consequentialism should be formulated in terms of compliance with rules or in terms of acceptance of rules. Admittedly, the most important aspect of accepting rules is compliance with them. And early formulations of rule-consequentialism did indeed explicitly mention compliance. For example, they said an act is morally wrong if and only if it is forbidden by rules the compliance with which will maximize the good (or the expected good). (See Austin 1832; Brandt 1959; Singer 1955; 1961.)

However, acceptance of a rule can have consequences other than compliance with the rule. As Kagan (2000, 139) writes, “once embedded, rules can have an impact on results that is independent of their impact on acts: it might be, say, that merely thinking about a set of rules reassures people, and so contributes to happiness.” (For more on what we might call these ‘beyond-compliance consequences’ of rules, see Sidgwick 1907, 405-6, 413; Lyons 1965, 140; Williams 1973, 119-20, 122, 129-30; Adams 1976, esp. 470; Scanlon 1998, 203-4; Kagan 1998, 227-34.)

These consequences of acceptance of rules should most definitely be part of a cost-benefit analysis of prospective rules. Formulating rule-consequentialism in terms of the consequences of acceptance allows them to be part of this analysis. In fact, consideration of assurance and incentive effects has played a large role in the development of rule-consequentialism (Harsanyi 1977; 1982, 56-61; 1993, 116-18; Brandt 1979, 271-7; 1988, 346ff [1992, 142ff.]; 1996, 126, 144; Johnson 1991, especially chs. 3, 4, 9).

Just as we need to move from thinking about the consequences of compliance to thinking about the wider consequences of acceptance, we need to go further. Focusing purely on the consequences of acceptance of rules ignores the “transition” costs of getting those rules accepted in the first place. And yet these can certainly be significant (Brandt 1963, section 4; 1967 [1992, 126]; 1983, 98; 1988, 346-47, 349-50 [1992, 140-143, 144-47]; 1996, 126-28, 145, 148, 152, 223).

Suppose, for example, that, once a fairly simple and relatively undemanding code of rules Code A has been accepted, the expected value of Code A would be n. Suppose the more complicated and demanding alternative Code B would have an expected value of n + 5 once Code B has been accepted. So if we just consider the expected values of acceptance of the two alternative codes, Code B wins.

But now let us add in the relative costs of getting the two codes accepted. Since Code A is fairly simple and relatively undemanding, the cost of getting it accepted is −1. Since Code B is more complicated and demanding, the cost of getting it accepted is −7. So if our comparison of the two codes considers the respective costs of getting them accepted, Code A's expected value is n-1, and Code B's is n+5-7. Once we include the respective costs of getting the codes accepted, Code A wins.

As indicated, the costs of getting a code accepted are “transition costs”. But of course such transitions are always to one arrangement from another. The arrangement we are imagining the transition being to is the acceptance of a certain proposed code. The arrangement we are imagining the transition being from is … well, what?

One answer is that the arrangement from which the transition is supposed to be starting is whatever moral code the society happens to accept already. That might seem like the natural answer, but in fact it is a poor one. The reason it is poor is that rule-consequentialism should not let the cost/benefit analysis of a proposed code be influenced by the costs of getting people to give up whatever rules they may have already internalised. This is for two reasons.

Most importantly, rule-consequentialist assessment of codes needs to avoid giving weight directly or indirectly to moral ideas that have their source in other moral theories but not in rule-consequentialism itself. Suppose people in a given society were brought up to believe that women should be subservient to men. Should rule-consequentialist evaluation of a proposed non-sexist code have to count the costs of getting people to give up the sexist rules they have already internalised so as to accept the new non-sexist ones? Since the sexist rules are unjustifiable, that they were accepted should not be allowed to infect rule-consequentialist assessment.

Another reason for rejecting the answer we are considering is that it threatens to underwrite an unattractive relativism. Different societies may differ considerably in their extant moral beliefs. So a way of assessing proposed codes that considers the costs of getting people already committed to some other code will end up having to countenance different transition costs to get to the same code. For example, the transition costs to a non-racist code are much more from an already accepted racist code than from an already accepted non-racist one. Formulating rule-consequentialism so that it endorses the same code for 1960s Michigan as for 1960s Mississippi is desirable.

The way to do this is to formulate the theory in terms of acceptance by new generations of humans. So we compare the respective “teaching costs” of alternative codes, on the assumption that these codes will be taught to children who have not already been educated to accept a moral code. We are to imagine the children start off with natural (non-moral) inclinations to be very partial towards themselves and a few others. We should also assume that there is a cognitive cost associated with the learning of each rule.

These are realistic assumptions, with big implications. One is that a cost/benefit analysis of alternative codes of rules would have reason to favor simpler codes over more complex ones. Of course there can also be benefits from having more, or more complicated, rules. Yet there is probably a limit on how complicated or complex a code can be and still have greater expected value than simpler codes, once teaching costs are included.

Another implication concerns prospective rules about making sacrifices to help others. Since children start off focused on their own gratifications, getting them to internalise a kind of impartiality that constantly requires them to make large sacrifices for the sake of others would have extremely high costs. There would also, of course, be enormous benefits from the internalisation of such a rule — predominately, benefits to others. Would the benefits be greater than the costs?

At least since Sidgwick (1907, 434), many utilitarians have taken for granted that human nature is such that the real possibilities are (1) that human beings care passionately about some and less about each of the rest of humanity, or (2) that human beings care weakly but impartially about everyone. In other words, what is not a realistic possibility, according to this view, is human beings' caring strongly and impartially about everyone in the world. If this view is correct, then one enormous cost of successfully making people completely impartial is that this would leave them with only weak concerns.

Even if that picture of human nature is not correct, it can hardly be plausibly denied that the cost of successfully making people care as much about every other individual as they do about themselves would be prohibitive. At some level, the costs of making people more impartial outweigh the benefits.

6.3 Complete Acceptance versus Incomplete Acceptance

Just as rule-consequentialists are more realistic if their cost/benefit analyses of codes count the cost of getting those codes internalised by new generations, they are more realistic if they assume that the internalisation will not extend to every last person. There will be some people who end up committed to the wrong morality. Others will never have accepted any morality at all (psychopaths). Rule-consequentialism needs to have rules for dealing with such people.

These will consist mainly in rules about punishment. From a rule-consequentialist point of view, the main point of punishment is to deter certain kinds of act. There is also the need to get undeterred, dangerous people off the streets. Perhaps rule-consequentialism can admit that another point of punishment is to appease the primitive lust for revenge on the part of victims of such acts and their family and friends. Finally, there is the expressive and reinforcing power of rules about punishment.

Nevertheless, some ways of formulating rule-consequentialism make having rules about punishment difficult to explain. One such way of formulating rule-consequentialism is:

An act is morally wrong if and only if it is prohibited by the code of rules the full acceptance of which by absolutely everyone would produce the greatest expected good.

Suppose absolutely every adult human fully accepts rules forbidding (for example) physical attacks on the innocent, stealing, promise breaking, and lying. Then presumably there would be little or no need for rules about punishment. Without need for rules about punishment, society would get little or no benefit from such rules. But there is a cost associated with each rule included in a code. So there is a cost associated with the inclusion of any rule about punishment. Because of this combination of cost with no benefit, rules about punishment would not be endorsed by the form of rule-consequentialism immediately above.

We need a form of rule-consequentialism that includes rules for dealing with people who are not committed to the right rules, indeed even for people who are irredeemable. In other words, rule-consequentialism needs to be formulated so as to conceptualise society as containing some people insufficiently committed to the right rules, and even some people never committed to any moral rules. Here is a way of doing so:

An act is wrong if and only if it is prohibited by a code of rules the acceptance of which by the overwhelming majority of people in each new generation would have the greatest expected value.

Note that rule-consequentialism neither endorses nor condones the non-acceptance of the code by those outside the overwhelming majority. On the contrary, rule-consequentialism claims those people are morally mistaken. Indeed, the whole point of formulating rule-consequentialism this way is to make room for rules about how to respond negatively to such people.

Another point to make about the above formulation is of course that “overwhelming majority” is very imprecise. Picking a precise percentage of society, say 90%, has an obvious element of arbitrariness to it (why not 89% or 91%?). Nevertheless, we can argue for a number in this range as a reasonable compromise between two pressures. On the one hand, the percentage we pick should be close enough to 100% to retain the idea that moral rules are for acceptance by the whole society of human beings. On the other hand, the percentage needs to be far enough short of 100% to leave considerable scope for rules about punishment. It seems that 90% is in a defensible range, given the need to balance those considerations. (For dissent from this, see Ridge 2006; for a reply to Ridge, see Hooker and Fletcher 2008.)

7. Two Ways of Arguing for Rule-consequentialism

We have seen that rule-consequentialism evaluates rules on the basis of the expected value of their acceptance by the overwhelming majority. What rules will such an approach endorse? It will endorse rules prohibiting physically attacking innocent people or their property, taking the property of others, breaking one's promises, and lying. It will also endorse rules requiring one to pay special attention to the needs of one's family and friends, but more generally to be willing to help others with their (morally permissible) projects. Why? The crude answer is that a society where such rules are widely accepted would be likely to have more good in it than one lacking such rules.

The fact that these rules are endorsed by rule-consequentialism makes rule-consequentialism attractive. For, intuitively, these rules seem right. However, other moral theories endorse these rules as well. Most obviously, a familiar kind of moral pluralism contends that these intuitively attractive rules constitute the most basic level of morality, i.e., that there is no deeper moral principle underlying and unifying these rules. Call this view Rossian pluralism (in honor of its champion W. D. Ross (1930; 1939)).

Rule-consequentialism may agree with Rossian pluralism in endorsing rules against physically attacking the innocent, stealing, promise breaking, and rules requiring various kinds of loyalty and more generally doing good for others. But rule-consequentialism goes beyond Rossian pluralism by specifying an underlying unifying principle that provides impartial justification for such rules. Other moral theories try to do this too. Such theories include some forms of Kantianism (Audi 2001; 2004), some forms of contractualism (Scanlon 1998), and some forms of virtue ethics (Hursthouse 1999; 2002; Foot 2000). In any case, the first way of arguing for rule-consequentialism is to argue that it specifies an underlying principle that provides impartial justification for intuitively plausible moral rules, and that no rival theory does this as well (Urmson 1953; Brandt 1967; Hospers 1972; Hooker 2000).

This first way of arguing for rule-consequentialism might be seen as drawing on the idea that a theory is better justified to us to the extent that it increases coherence within our beliefs <link to coherentism> (Rawls 1951; 1971, pp. 19-21, 46-51; DePaul 1987; Ebertz 1993; Sayre-McCord 1986; 1996). But the approach might also be seen as moderately foundationalist in that it begins with a set of beliefs (in various moral rules) to which it assigns independent credibility though not infallibility <link to foundationalism> (Audi 1996; 2004; Crisp 2000). Admittedly, coherence with our moral beliefs does not make a moral theory true, since our moral beliefs might of course be mistaken. Nevertheless, if a moral theory fails significantly to cohere with our moral beliefs, this undermines the theory's ability to be justified to us.

The second way of arguing for rule-consequentialism is very different. It starts from a commitment to consequentialist assessment, and then argues that assessing acts indirectly, e.g., by focusing on the consequences of communal acceptance of rules, will in fact produce better consequences than assessing acts directly in terms of their own consequences (Austin 1832; Brandt 1963; 1979; Harsanyi 1982, pp. 58-60; 1993; Riley 2000). After all, making decisions about what to do is the main point of moral assessment of acts. So if a way of morally assessing acts is likely to lead to bad decisions, or more generally lead to bad consequences, then, according to a consequentialist point of view, so much the worse for that way of assessing acts.

Earlier we saw that all consequentialists now accept that assessing each act individually by its expected value is a terrible procedure for making moral decisions. There is widespread acknowledgement that agents should decide how to act by appeal to certain rules such as “don't physically attack others”, “don't steal”, “don't break your promises”, “pay special attention to the needs of your family and friends”, and “be generally helpful to others”. And these are the rules that rule-consequentialism endorses.

Many consequentialists, however, think this hardly shows that full rule-consequentialism is the best form of consequentialism. These consequentialists distinguish between the best procedure for making moral decisions about what to do, and the criteria of moral rightness and wrongness. Once these philosophers have this distinction in hand, they admit that we need rule-consequentialism's rules for our decision procedure (so they accept what we dubbed partial rule-consequentialism). But they contend that such rules play no role in the criterion of moral rightness (so they reject full rule-consequentialism).

As suggested earlier, partial rule-consequentialism gets into difficulties over its distinction between decision procedures and criteria of rightness or wrongness. If that distinction ultimately falls, then with it falls the objection we have just been considering to the second way of arguing for rule-consequentialism.

Yet the second way of arguing for rule-consequentialism runs into another and quite different objection. This objection is that the first step in this argument for rule-consequentialism is a commitment to consequentialist assessment. This first step itself needs justification. Why assume that assessing things in a consequentialist way is uniquely justified?

It might be said that consequentialist assessment is justified because promoting the impartial good has an obvious intuitive appeal. But that won't do, since alternatives to consequentialist assessment also have obvious intuitive appeal. This is true, for example, of “act on the code that no one could reasonably reject”. In fact, no one very abstract moral idea is so clearly superior to its rivals that it can triumph without the aid of further justification. What we need is a way of arguing for a moral theory that does not start by begging the question which kind of theory is most plausible.

One argument for a consequentialist principle, which then leads on to rule-consequentialism, is especially associated with John Harsanyi (1982; 1993) but there is a related argument in Brandt (1979; 1988; 1996). This argument pictures morality as a kind of hypothetical or idealized social contract. So this argument is often thought of as an argument for rule-consequentialism from contractualism.

Here is how this contractualist argument is supposed to work. Suppose we can specify conditions under which everyone's consent to a code of rules would legitimate that code of rules. There are different views about what those conditions would be (Harsanyi 1953; 1955; 1982; Rawls 1971; Brandt 1979; Scanlon 1982). Sometimes the claim is that everyone's impartiality would have to be insured by the imposition of a hypothetical “veil of ignorance” behind which no one knew any specific facts about himself or herself (Harsanyi 1953; 1955). Sometimes the claim is that everyone sitting down to write up the social contract should know all relevant empirical facts and have whatever natural motivations but not have any superior bargaining power (Brandt 1979). Other theories specify other conditions. And some of these contractualist theories maintain that what everyone in those conditions would agree to is a morality that maximizes the good.

It is a further step to maintain that the morality that would maximize the good is a rule-consequentialist one. That is precisely the further step made by what we are calling the second way of arguing for rule-consequentialism. But now this second way of arguing for rule-consequentialism rests on a contractualist premise. Just as there is the good question “Why start from a consequentialist premise?”, there is the good question “Why start from a contractualist premise?”

The first way of arguing for rule-consequentialism does not start by begging that (or any other normative) question. The first way instead tries to show that rule-consequentialism does better than any other moral theory at specifying an impartial justification for intuitively plausible moral rules. But the first way of arguing for rule-consequentialism is vulnerable. This way of arguing for rule-consequentialism will be sunk if it can be shown that rule-consequentialism does not in fact justify intuitively plausible rules. And even if no devastatingly counterintuitive implications of the best form of rule-consequentialism have yet been discovered, this cannot prove that none will be.

8. Old Objections to Rule-consequentialism

Rule-consequentialism was not clearly formulated until Urmson 1953 and Brandt 1959. The theory attracted considerable attention until the early 1970s. Since the early 1970s, however, most moral philosophers have thought of rule-consequentialism as fatally impaled on one or the other horn of the following dilemma: Either rule-consequentialism collapses into practical equivalence with the simpler act-consequentialism, or rule-consequentialism is incoherent.

Here is why some have thought rule-consequentialism collapses into practical equivalence with act-consequentialism. Consider a rule that rule-consequentialism purports to favor — e.g., “don't lie”. Now suppose an agent is in some situation where lying would definitely produce more good than not lying. If rule-consequentialism selects rules on the basis of their expected good, rule-consequentialism seems driven to admit that compliance with the rule “don't lie except in cases like this” is better than compliance with the simpler “don't lie”. This point generalizes. In other words, for every situation where compliance with some rule would not produce the greatest expected good, rule-consequentialism seems driven to favor instead compliance with some amended rule that does not miss out on producing the greatest expected good in the case at hand. But if rule-consequentialism operates this way, then in practice it will end up requiring the very same acts that act-consequentialism requires.

If rule-consequentialism ends up requiring the very same acts that act-consequentialism requires, then rule-consequentialism is indeed in terrible trouble. Rule-consequentialism is the more complicated of the two theories. This leads to the following objection. What is the point of rule-consequentialism with its infinitely amended rules if we can get the same practical result much more efficiently with the simpler act-consequentialism?

Rule-consequentialists in fact have an excellent reply to the objection that their theory collapses into practical equivalence with act-consequentialism. This reply relies on the point that the best kind of rule-consequentialism ranks systems of rules not in terms of the expected good of complying with them, but in terms of the expected good of their acceptance. Consider widespread awareness of a ready willingness to incorporate an indefinite number of exceptions to rules. This widespread awareness could undermine people's assurance that others will behave in certain ways (such as keeping promises and avoiding stealing).

Furthermore, when comparing alternative rules, we must also consider the relative costs of getting them accepted by new generations. Clearly, the costs of getting new generations to learn hugely complicated and enormously demanding rules would be prohibitive. So rule-consequentialism will favor a code of rules without too many rules, too much complication within the rules, or rules that are too demanding.

True, the code of rules that rule-consequentialism favors can sometimes lead agents to do acts that do not have the greatest expected value possible. Still, rule-consequentialism's claim is that bringing about widespread acceptance of a simpler code, even if acceptance of that code does sometimes lead people to do acts with sub-optimal consequences, has higher expected value in the long run than bringing about widespread acceptance of a much more complicated and demanding code. Because rule-consequentialism favors this simpler and less demanding code, rule-consequentialism implies that an act can be morally wrong though that act maximizes expected good. Because rule-consequentialism implies this, rule-consequentialism escapes collapse into practical equivalence to act-consequentialism.

Now we have the other horn of the dilemma. This second horn supposed that it is incoherent for rule-consequentialism to hold that an act can be morally wrong though the act maximizes expected good. Why would this be thought incoherent? The assumption must be that rule-consequentialism contains an overarching commitment to maximize the good. It is incoherent to have this overarching commitment and then to oppose an act required by the commitment.

In order to evaluate the incoherence objection to rule-consequentialism, we need to be clearer about the supposed location of the overarching commitment to maximize the good that this objection attributes to rule-consequentialism. Is this commitment supposed to be part of the rule-consequentialist agent's moral psychology? Or is it supposed to be part of the theory rule-consequentialism?

Well, rule-consequentialists need not have maximizing the good as their ultimate moral goal. Instead, they could have a moral psychology as follows:

Their fundamental moral motivation is to do what is impartially defensible.

They believe acting on impartially justified rules is impartially defensible.

They also believe that rule-consequentialism is on balance the best account of impartially justified rules.

Agents with this moral psychology — i.e., this combination of moral motivation and beliefs — would be morally motivated to do as rule-consequentialism prescribes. This moral psychology is certainly possible. And, for agents who have it, there is nothing incoherent about following rules when doing so will not maximize the expected good.

So, even if rule-consequentialist agents need not have an overarching commitment to maximize expected good, does their theory contain such a commitment? No, rule-consequentialism is essentially the conjunction of two claims: (1) that rules are to be selected solely in terms of their consequences and (2) that these rules determine which kinds of acts are morally wrong. This is really all there is to the theory — in particular, there is not some third component consisting in or entailing an overarching commitment to maximize expected good.

Without an overarching commitment to maximize the expected good, there is nothing incoherent in rule-consequentialism's forbidding some kinds of act, even when they maximize the expected good. Likewise, there is nothing incoherent about rule-consequentialism's requiring other kinds of act, even when they conflict with maximizing the expected good. The best known objection to rule-consequentialism dies once we realize that neither the rule-consequentialist agent nor the theory itself contains an overarching commitment to maximize the good.

The viability of this defense of rule-consequentialism against the incoherence objection may depend in part on what the argument for rule-consequentialism is supposed to be. The defense seems less viable if the argument for rule-consequentialism starts from a commitment to consequentialist assessment. For starting with such a commitment seems very close to starting from an overarching commitment to maximize the expected good. The defense seems far more secure, however, if the argument for rule-consequentialism is that this theory does better than any other moral theory at specifying an impartial justification for intuitively plausible moral rules. (For further debate about the objection that rule-consequentialism must be guilty of either collapse or inconsistency or impurity, see Card 2007 and Hooker 2007.)

Another old objection to rule-consequentialism is that rule-consequentialists must be “rule-worshipers” — i.e., people who will stick to the rules even when doing so will obviously be disastrous.

The answer to this objection is that rule-consequentialism endorses a rule requiring one to prevent disaster, even if doing so requires breaking other rules (Brandt 1992, 87-8, 150-1, 156-7). To be sure, there are many complexities about what counts as a disaster. Think about what counts as a disaster when the “prevent disaster” rule is in competition with a rule against lying. Now think about what counts as a disaster when the “prevent disaster” rule is in competition with a rule against stealing, or even more when in competition with a rule against physically harming the innocent. Rule-consequentialism may need to be clearer about such matters. But at least it cannot rightly be accused of potentially leading to disaster.

An important confusion to avoid is to think that rule-consequentialism's including a “prevent disaster” rule means that rule-consequentialism collapses into practical equivalence with act-consequentialism. Act-consequentialism holds that we should lie, or steal, or harm the innocent whenever doing so would produce even a little higher expected good than not doing so would. A rule requiring one to prevent disaster does not have this implication. Rather, the “prevent disaster” rule comes into play only when there is a very much larger difference in the amounts of expected value at stake.

9. New Objections to Rule-consequentialism

New objections to rule-consequentialism try to capitalize on the theory's vulnerability to counterexample. In other words, such objections try to show that, given the theory's criterion for selecting rules, there are conditions under which it selects immoral rules, especially because they are either excessively or insufficiently demanding. For example, Tom Carson (1991) has argued that rule-consequentialism turns out to be extremely demanding in the real world. Mulgan (2001, esp. ch. 3) agrees with Carson about that, and goes on to argue that, even if rule-consequentialism's implications in the actual world are fine, the theory has counterintuitive implications in possible worlds. If Mulgan is right about that, this casts doubt on rule-consequentialism's claim to explain why certain demands are appropriate in the actual world. Debate about such matters continues (Hooker 2003; Lawlor 2004).

A related new objection to rule-consequentialism is that rule-consequentialism makes the justification of familiar rules contingent on various empirical facts, such as what human nature is like, and how many people there are in need or in positions to help. The objection to rule-consequentialism is that some familiar moral rules are necessarily, not merely contingently, justified (McNaughton and Rawling 1998; Gaut 1999; 2002; Montague 2000; Suikkanen 2008). Again, debate about this matter continues.

Another new objection focuses on the mechanics of teaching new codes. Rule-consequentialism, as formulated above, counts the costs of getting rules internalised by new generations. The reference to new generations is meant to avoid having to count the costs of getting rules internalised by existing generations of people who have already internalised some other moral rules and ideas. But now we have the problem of coming up with a coherent description of those who are supposed to do the teaching of these new generations. If the teachers are imagined to have already internalised the ideal code themselves, then how is that supposed to have happened? If these teachers are imagined not to have already internalised the ideal code, then there will be costs associated with the conflict between the ideal code and whatever they have already internalised. (This objection was formulated by John Andrews, Robert Ehman, and Andrew Moore. Cf. Levy 2000.)

Yet another new objection is that rule-consequentialism has not yet been formulated in a way that enables it to deal plausibly with conflicts among rules (Eggleston 2007).

As long as the old objections to rule-consequentialism held sway, philosophers were not interested in new objections to the theory. Now that the old objections seem to have been overcome, there is considerable interest in new objections.

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Acknowledgments

This entry has benefited from very generous comments by Rob Lawlor, Gerald Lang, Andrew Moore, Tim Mulgan, Walter Sinnott-Armstrong, and Peter Vallentyne.