Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy
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Japanese Zen Buddhist Philosophy

First published Wed Jun 28, 2006

Zen aims at a perfection of personhood. To this end, sitting meditation called “za-zen” is employed as a foundational method of prāxis across the different schools of this Buddha-Way, through which the Zen practitioner attempts to embody non-discriminatory wisdom vis-à-vis the meditational experience known as “satori” (enlightenment). A process of discovering wisdom culminates in the experiential dimension in which the equality of thing-events is apprehended in discerning them. The most distinguishing feature of this school of the Buddha-Way is seen in its contention that wisdom, accompanied by compassion, is expressed in the everyday “life-world” when associating with one's self, people, and nature. The everyday “life-world” for most people is an evanescent transforming stage in which living is consumed, philosophically speaking, by an either-or, ego-logical, dualistic paradigm of thinking with its attendant psychological states such as stress and anxiety. Zen demands an overcoming of this paradigm by practically achieving an holistic perspective in cognition, so that the Zen practitioner can celebrate, with a stillness of mind, a life of tending toward the concrete thing-events of everyday life and nature. For this reason, the Zen practitioner is required to embody freedom expressive of the original human nature. Generally speaking, Zen cherishes simplicity and straightforwardness in grasping reality and acting on it “here and now,” for it believes that a thing-event that is immediately presencing before one's eyes or under one's foot is no other than an expression of suchness, i.e., it is such that it is showing its primordial mode of being. It also understands a specificity of thing-event to be a recapitulation of the whole; parts and the whole are to be lived in an inseparable relationship through an exercise of nondiscriminatory wisdom, without prioritizing the visible over the invisible, the explicit over the implicit, and vice versa. As such, Zen maintains a stance of “not one” and “not two,” i.e., “positionless position,” where “not two” signals a negation of the stance that divides the whole into two parts, i.e., dualism, while “not one” designates a negation of this stance when the Zen practitioner dwells in the whole as one, while suspending judgment in meditation, i.e., non-dualism. Free, bilateral movement between “not one” and “not two” characterizes Zen's achievement of a personhood with a third perspective that cannot, however, be confined to either dualism or non-dualism (i.e., neither “not one” nor “not two”).

1. The Meaning of the Term Zen

The designation of this school of the Buddha-Way as Zen, which means sitting meditation, is derived from a transliteration of the Chinese word Chán. Because the Chinese term is in turn a transliteration of the Sanskrit term dhyāna, however, Zen owes its historical origin to early Indian Buddhism, where a deepened state of meditation (samādhi) was singled out as one of the three components of study a Buddhist was required to master, the other two being an observation of ethical precepts (sīla) and an embodiment of nondiscriminatory wisdom (prajñā). The reason that meditation was singled out for the designation of this school is based on the fact that the historical Buddha achieved enlightenment (nirvāna) through the practice of meditation. In the context of Zen Buddhism, perfection of nondiscriminatory wisdom (Jpn., hannya haramitsu; Skrt., prajñāpāramitā) designates practical, experiential knowledge, and secondarily and only derivatively theoretical, intellectual knowledge. This is, Zen explains, because theoretical knowledge is a form of “language game” (Jpn.; keron; Skrt., prapañca), i.e., discrimination through the use of language, as it is built in part on distinction-making. Zen believes that it ultimately carries no existential meaning for emancipating a human being from his or her predicaments, for it maintains that discriminatory knowledge of any kind is delusory/illusory in nature. To this effect it holds that it is through a practical transformation of the psychophysiological constitution of one's being that one prepares for embodying nondiscriminatory wisdom. This preparation involves the training of the whole person and is called “self-cultivation” (shugyō) in Japanese. It is a practical method of correcting the modality of one's mind by correcting the modality of one's body, in which practice (prāxis) is given precedence over theory (theōria). (Yuasa, 1987.)

2. Zen's Methods: Kōan Practice and Just Sitting

There are basically two methods utilized in meditation practice in Zen Buddhism to assist the practitioner to reach the above-mentioned goals, together with a simple breathing exercise known as “observation of breath count” (Jpn., sūsokukan); one is the kōan method and the other is called “just sitting” (Jpn., shikan taza), a form of “single act samādhi.” For example, the former is employed mainly by the Rinzai school of Zen Buddhism, while the latter by the Sōtō school; they are the two main schools of this form of the Buddha-Way still flourishing today in Japan. In the Rinzai school, the kōan method is devised to assist the practitioner to become a “Zen person” (Kasulis, 1981) who fully embodies both wisdom and compassion. A kōan is formulated like a riddle or puzzle and is designed in such a way that intellectual reasoning alone cannot solve it without breaking through ego-consciousness by driving it to its limit. This is, Zen believes, because it is fortified by the shield of a dualistic conceptual paradigm with all its attendant presuppositions and conditions which the ego-consciousness in a given cultural and historical milieu accepts to be true in order to live a life anchored in the everyday standpoint.

According to Hakuin (1685-1768), who systematized kōans, there are formally seventeen hundred cases of kōans, and if sub-questions are added to them, a total number of cases comprising the system would roughly be three thousand. The Zen practitioner of the Rinzai school is required to pass them all in a private consultation with a Zen master who checks the practitioner's state of mind before he or she is granted a seal of transmission. This transmission is said to occur “only from a Buddha to a[nother] Buddha” (yuibutsu yobutsu). Kōans are accordingly grouped into five categories in a most fully developed system: the first group is designed for 1) reaching li (suchness) (richi) or the body of truth (hosshin), 2) the second group for a linguistic articulation (gensen) of meditational experiences, 3) the third group for those kōans truly difficult to pass (nantō), 4) the fourth group for the practitioner to make an insight of kōan experiences pertinent in daily life (kikan), and 5) the fifth group for going beyond the state of buddhahood by erasing traces of enlightenment (kōjō). The Rinzai school summarizes this process of self-cultivation in four mottoes: “a special transmission outside of the scriptures,” “no dependence on words and letters,” “point directly into [one's] human mind,” and “see into [one's] nature to become a buddha.” (See, for examples, The Gateless Gate and The Blue Cliff Record.) While the first two phrases point to the fact of discovering an extra-linguistic reality that naturally opens up in meditational experience and of articulating it linguistically in the “best” way according to the capacity of an individual practitioner, the last two phrases indicate a concretization of the original enlightenment (hongaku) in the Zen practitioner, where the original enlightenment means that the human being is innately endowed with a possibility of becoming a Buddha.

On the other hand, the Sōtō school, of which Dōgen (1200-54) is the founder, does not rely on an elaborate kōan system to learn to become a Zen person, but instead follows a method called “just sitting” (shikan taza). It refers to a single-minded, diligent practice where the qualifying term “just” means the practice of meditation without any intervention of ego-logical interest, concern, or desire, so that the practice remains undefiled. This is a method of meditation predicated on the belief that the Zen practitioner engages in the practice in the midst of the original enlightenment. Or to characterize it by using Dōgen's phrase, it is a method of “practice-realization.” By hyphenating practice and realization, the following implications are suggested: meditation is not a means to an end, i.e., a means to realization, and thereby Dōgen closes a dualistic gap, for example, between potentiality and actuality, between before and after. Accordingly, he collapses the distinction between “acquired enlightenment” (shikaku) and “original enlightenment,” where the “acquired” enlightenment means an enlightenment that is realized through the practice of meditation as a means. With this collapsing, the Sōtō School holds that practice and realization are non-dual to each other, i.e., “not two.”

According to the Sōtō school, the meditational practice, when it is seen as a process of discovery, is a deepening process of becoming aware of the original enlightenment with an expansion of its corresponding experiential correlates and horizons, and it is for this reason called the school of “gradual enlightenment” or “silent illumination.” On the other hand, the Rinzai school is called the school of “sudden enlightenment,” because it does not recognize a process leading to enlightenment (satori) as something worthy of a special attention; what counts is an experience of satori only. Even though there is the above difference in approach between Rinzai and Sōtō schools, the outcome is the same for both insofar as the embodiment of wisdom and compassion is concerned. This is because they both follow the same practice of sitting meditation. Whatever differences there are between the practitioners of the two schools in regard to the linguistic articulation of their meditational experience, they arise from an individual practitioner's personality, disposition, intellectual capacity, and/or linguistic ability.

3. Zen as Anti-Philosophy

As may be surmised from the foregoing explanation on Zen's methodological stance, it is perhaps best to understand Zen as an anti-philosophy if the term “philosophy” is taken to mean the establishment of “the kingdom of reason,” which has been launched vis-à-vis an intellectual effort of the most brilliant minds in Europe since the modern period as a way of emancipating human nature from the confines of Christian theological dogmas. Since then, various Western philosophers have attempted to capture human nature with this goal in mind by using ego-consciousness as a starting point as well as a destination in philosophy; to name a few representative ones, human nature has been captured in terms of ego-consciousness (e.g., Descartes), Reason, Personality, Transcendental Subjectivity (e.g., Kant and Husserl), Life (e.g., Dilthey), Existence (e.g., Existential philosophers such as Kierkgaard, Jaspers and Sartre) and Dasein (Heidegger). (Yuasa, 2003, 160-61.)

By contrast, Zen's stance of “anti-philosophy” maintains among other things that reason in its discursive use is incapable of knowing and understanding in toto what reality is, for example, what human beings are and what their relation to nature is. For this reason, Zen contends that physical nature and human nature must be sought in an experiential dimension practically trans-descending, and hence transcending, the standpoint of ego-consciousness. Instead, they must be sought in the depths of one's psyche and beyond. For example, Zen Master Seigen (Chin.,; Qīngyuáng, 660-740) expresses the process of self-cultivation to the effect that: “Before the practice, mountains are mountains, during the practice, mountains are not mountains, and after the realization, mountains are [truly] mountains [again].” In the meditational process of discovery then, Zen moves from an ordinary, commonsensical standpoint to an extraordinary standpoint and with this transformation returns to the everyday “life-world,” wherein no Aristotelian either-or logic is accepted as the standard for knowing and understanding reality. Due to this reason, paradoxes, contradictions, and even what appears to be utter nonsense abound in Zen literature. The kōan method mentioned above exemplifies this point. To cite just one such example: “the river does not flow but the bridge does.” The impression is that this is utter nonsense as long as Zen literature is read only with Aristotelian either-or logic as the standard for understanding.

As may be surmised then, by relying on the above-mentioned methodological stance, Zen Buddhism has produced an understanding of reality—one's own self, living nature and human nature—quite different from those offered by Western philosophy. Therefore, we can say that Zen is an anti-philosophy in that it is not a systematization of knowledge built on the use of a discursive mode of reasoning anchored in the (alleged) certainty of ego-consciousness, following an Aristotelian either-or logic. Yet, it upholds something like a philosophy that springs forth through a reflective restatement of the practice, though this “upholding” must be understood with a proviso that it maintains, as mentioned in the foregoing, a “positionless position.” (Abe, 1989.) This is because Zen abhors “holding onto” anything, which Zen considers an instance of “self-binding without a rope.” That is, this self-binding traps the Zen practitioner into a mode of attachment that is the source of suffering and, consequently, disrupts the sense of embodied freedom it cherishes.

4. Overcoming Dualism

Accordingly, Zen demands the practitioner to overcome the dualism operative in the everyday standpoint, which it speaks of by using the phase “not two.” This is Zen's proclivity to favor the simple and the concrete, as it is not expressed as a negation of dualism. This overcoming is an existential project, a goal for the Zen practitioner, although it is paradoxically stated as “if you face it, it goes away,” because “facing” presupposes a dualistic stance. “Two” in “not two” designates any “two” things appearing from within the everyday standpoint when taken to carry an absolute sense of reality. This standpoint, as mentioned in the foregoing, relies on the discursive mode of reasoning to understand reality, while presupposing an ego-consciousness as the referential point. From this perspective for example, a distinction between the outer and inner worlds emerges. One of the salient characteristics of this standpoint is that the world appears to be dualistic in nature, that is to say, it recognizes two (and by implication, many) things to be real. Zen questions this standpoint when it is used as the paradigm for daily living, including philosophical thinking, for this standpoint accepts as its foundation an individual's discrete “I” with a belief that “I” am self-contained and self-sufficient and, therefore, am distinguished and isolated from other individuals and things of nature. Zen observes that it renders opaque, or at best translucent, the experiential domains beyond the sensible world as well as ego-consciousness, both either taken naturalistically or vis-à-vis theoretical speculation. The inability to go beyond these experiential domains, Zen explains, occurs because ego-consciousness is physiologically rooted in the body and psychologically in the unconscious. This points to a philosophically important consequence. Namely, once the practitioner accepts this outer-inner dichotomy even provisionally, he or she is led to accept as true a host of other “two” things that are affirmed to be real, as is seen in pairs of opposites such as mind vs. body, I vs. others, love vs. hate, good vs. evil, and I vs. nature.

4.1 Logical Meaning of Not Two

Logically speaking, Zen explains that “two” things arise because the everyday standpoint stipulates Aristotelian either-or logic as the standard for cognizing the whole, however the whole may be construed. (Nagatomo, 2000, 213-44.) This logic thinks it reasonable to divide the whole into two parts when knowing or understanding reality. That is, when this logic is applied to the whole, it compels the user of this logic to choose, reasonably in the mind of the user, one part, while disregarding the other part(s) as irrelevant or meaningless. It prioritizes one part at the expense of the other part(s), while celebrating the exclusion. In so doing, it looks to the explicit while being oblivious to the fact that the implicit equally exists as a supporting ground for the explicit, where the explicit is something “obvious” to the senses and the rational mind. However, Zen thinks that this prioritization, this exclusion, violates a cardinal principle of knowing, for knowledge of anything demands an understanding of the whole. Either-or logic fails on this account. Moreover, it contends that when this logic attempts to understand the whole, it theoretically reduces the other to the one that is judged to be true and/or real. For example, if one maintains that the mind is real, one disregards the body as unreal, yielding an idealist position. On the other hand, if one thinks the body is real, it disposes of the mind in the same way, favoring materialism as is presupposed, for example, by natural science. Either position commits itself to reductionism. Here, questioning this practice and the consequences it entails, Zen instead speaks of mind-body oneness, an holistic perspective. Zen abhors one-sidedness. However, it warns that as soon as “one” is contrasted with “two” in a discourse, it is no longer genuine and authentic, because once it is objectified linguistically or reflectively, it slips into being an idea, an abstraction.

4.2 An Epistemological Meaning of Not Two

From the point of view of epistemology developed by modern European philosophy, the “two things” are the subject who knows and the object that is known. Zen finds this to be a structurally established dualistic, either-or, ego-logical epistemological framework. That structure unknowingly frames how the epistemological subject should understand itself as well as its object and, consequently, how they should appear. According to this model, the subject stands opposed either to the outer world (e.g., nature) or to the inner world (the world of psyche), or both. Moreover, Zen notes that the subject cannot by definition become the object or vice versa, for they are distanced from each other either really or ideally. It depends on whether the “distance” and “opposition” occur in space-consciousness or in time-consciousness; an object appears to be “out there” with space-consciousness, while it appears to be “in here” as an immanent object in the field of consciousness in time-consciousness. Suppose one applies this epistemological structure in knowing others, for example, one's friend. When one attempts to know her from the everyday standpoint, one relies on the language she speaks and her body language. Here one cannot know her in toto, let alone the destiny of her life-history, because she is shielded from an observer by the spatial-temporal density of her being.

4.3 Zen's Meaning of Not Two

Zen maintains that the situation created by assuming this epistemological standpoint is not ideal, or real, for that matter. Hence, Zen says “not two.” “Not two” is in part a recommendation for experientially achieving oneness through the practice of meditation, informing the holder of the “two” of the narrow and limited scope of her/his understanding, where the idea of oneness may, for now, be conceived at many levels, starting with the physical, the subtle, and the samādhic. Generally speaking then, Zen takes “not two” to designate a negation of any “two” things that are affirmed to be individually real, in which the perspective that realizes the place or domain where two things occur is ignored. The dualistic standpoint also ignores the logical fact that any “two” things cannot be individually one because for one to be, it must be dependent on, and interconnects with, the other one. With this recommendation, Zen maintains that mind and body, I and others, I and nature ought to be experienced as one for those who remain in the everyday standpoint. To express this idea, Zen states that “Heaven and Earth share the same root, and I and the myriad things are one (-body).” It demands an holistic perspective necessary to achieve knowledge that is genuine and authentic. Otherwise, Zen fears that the practitioner will fall into one-sidedness, in which knowledge claim ends up being partial, imbalanced, and even prejudiced. Dōgen captures it by stating: “When one side is illuminated, the other side remains in darkness.” To characterize the dualistic, either-or ego-logical standpoint by borrowing Nietzsche's phrase, Zen would say that it is “human, and all too human.”

Care must be exercised in understanding the meaning of “not” in the phrase “not two” however. Zen insists that the “not” primarily refers to an existential, practical negation of the “I,” which means “up-rooting the ego-consciousness” and in turn yields, by implication, a logical negation as well. This is because Zen thinks the practitioner cannot achieve this negation simply by following either-or logic, or for that matter by following the intellectual process of reasoning, because both logic and reasoning intrinsically involve two things, for example, the thinker and the thought. Or with either-or logic, a mere logical negation involves an infinite regress in negating the “I”; one who negates the “I” retains the affirmative act of holding “I” in the mind as that which negates. And when the “I” further attempts to negate this affirming act, there still remains an “I” who negates it and the process goes on ad infinitum. For this reason, Zen recommends the practitioner to “forget the ‘I”” when engaging oneself in any action, be it a mind-act, bodily-act, or speech-act, as is seen for example in both Dōgen and Takuan (1573-1645).

To recapitulate the idea of the Zen meaning of negation as expressed in “not two,” Zen sees its self-cultivation as involving a thoroughgoing negation of the “I” to the point that no problem, either existential or psychological, entrenched in the “I” remains. Hence, we have Rinzai's phrase: “if you becomes a master in any place, wherever you stand is true.” (Iriya, 1989, 70) Truth for Zen is not merely a matter of formulating or uttering a propositional statement, but rather embodying it by becoming, to use his phrase again, a “true person of no rank,” (ibid, 20) where “no rank” designates the freedom of standing beyond social or linguistic conventions such that a Zen person can use convention freely. Equally important is Zen's contention that both logical and intellectual methods are abstract, for they become divorced from the actual reality of day-to-day existence. In other words, in the eyes of Zen, these methods lack consideration for the concreteness and immediacy of lived experience. This is because the theoretical standpoint defines the human being who observes things of nature from outside, i.e., a “being-outside-of-nature.” Instead, Zen maintains that the human being must be understood as a being rooted in nature, i.e., “being-in-nature.” This point is well portrayed in Zen's landscape paintings wherein a human figure occupies the space of a mere dot in vast natural scenery. (Yuasa, 2003, 160-1)

5. An Experiential Meaning of Not-Two

How does Zen then articulate the experiential meaning of “not two”? Throughout its long history, which spans from the sixth century in China to the twenty-first century in Japan, Zen has produced numerous ways of linguistically capturing a response to this question, depending on what “two” things are thematized in the Zen dialogue (Zen mondō). As a textual study, these dialogues are a primary paradigm for how a discourse unfolds between a Zen master and his disciple. Moreover, this situation is complicated by the fact that a Zen master's response is usually tailored to an individual disciple's caliber. This is in keeping with a general method of teaching in Buddhism (taiki seppō). This complication is further compounded by the differences in the personality of Zen masters. Hence, Zen's responses to the above question are as varied and numerous as there are Zen masters. In spite of this situation, it is reasonably possible to provide a glimpse into the experiential meaning of “not two” by looking into a phrase that often appears in Zen dialogues. This phrase is “no-thought and no-image” (munen musō).

5.1 Zen's No-Thought and No-Image

Upon hearing the phrase, “no-thought and no-image,” one may wonder if there could be such a thing. To properly respond to this question, Zen thinks it important to determine whether it is posed with a practical concern or a theoretical concern in mind. The difference allows a Zen master to determine the ground out of which this question is raised, for example, to determine if the inquirer is anchored in the everyday standpoint or in a meditational standpoint. In the case of the former, for instance, Zen would respond by saying that as long as the inquirer poses this question from within the everyday standpoint with a theoretical interest, relying on Aristotelian either-or logic, the inquirer cannot understand the meaning of “no-thought and no-image,” as intended by Zen. This is because to formulate the question, “Is there or is there not no-thought and no-image?” linguistically drives the inquiry into a contradiction, for one cannot predicate “is” on “no-thought.” Only insofar as “no-thought” or “no-image” is treated as an idea in a linguistic space without consideration for its referent, can one ask if “there is” or “there is not” such a thing as “no-thought.” In response, Zen maintains that when “there is” or “there is not” is topicalized in its tradition, it is not the same as “there is” or “there is not” as understood from within the everyday standpoint. Zen claims that neither “no-thought” nor “no-image” can be linguistically or logically apprehended from its standpoint.

Why does Zen insist on this? Zen explains that both “there is” and “there is not” (or more generally “being” and “non-being”) are intellectually framed from within the everyday standpoint by accepting the oppositional ontology where the meaning of “is” is predicated on the meaning of “is not,” and vice versa. Therefore, Zen maintains that to understand “no-thought” or “no-image” we need an experiential dimension that goes beyond the oppositional thinking of the everyday standpoint.

5.2 Zen's Nothing

Zen condenses “no-thought and no-image” into a singular word “no” in keeping with its proclivity to favor the simple, as this contraction allows Zen to expand the scope and the meaning of “no-thought and no-image.” This “no,” for example, is made pivotal by Zen Master Joshū (Chin., Zhaozhōu; 778-897). It is usually rendered in English as “nothing” and has been presented to the Western reader as if it is the central and cardinal concept of Zen philosophy. At the risk of de-emphasizing other important aspects of Zen such as how it understands the living phenomena of nature, humanity's relation to them, and aesthetic sensitivity, we will here focus on the scope and meaning of this Zen “no.”

This “no” appears in a Zen dialogue between Joshū and a monk, in which is thematized an issue of whether or not a dog has Buddha-nature. It reads as follows: A monk asks Joshū: “Does the dog have buddha-nature?” He replies: “No[thing].” The monk says: “All sentient beings have buddha-nature. Why doesn’t the dog have it?” Joshū replies: “He has discrimination due to his karma.” Joshū's response of “no” to the monk's question points to the latter's inadequate, and hence also mistaken, understanding of being. However, as articulated in the Nirvānasūtra, Mahāyāna Buddhism, of which Zen is an offshoot, asserts that all sentient beings have buddha-nature. With this understanding the monk asked the question, to which Joshū replied “no.” His “no” points to the fact that the way the monk formulates his question regarding being is predicated on an either-or logical understanding or an affirmation-negation linguistic expression. In so doing, the monk relativizes Buddha-nature qua being, while contrasting and opposing it with non-being. Buddha-nature is not something that the dog can have or not have; Buddha-nature is not something contingent. Joshū's “no” allows the monk to return to the ground from which the idea of the Buddha-nature springs forth as an essential characterization of all beings. As such, Joshū's “no” points to a transcendence of being and non-being. Insofar as Zen's “no” is turned into an issue questioning the ground of being, it is appropriate to understand it as “nothing,” as “absolutely nothing.”

As Joshū's “nothing” has been made a kōan, numerous Zen masters have used it to test a student's progress in meditation. In such a case, a Zen Master expects a monk to come up with his or her original response by stipulating a condition: “I don’t expect you to answer that the dog has buddha-nature nor that the dog does not have buddha-nature. Nor do I expect you to reply that the dog neither has nor does not have buddha-nature. How do you respond to this?” This is a warning that a monk cannot rely on Nāgārjuna's tetralemma as an acceptable response, namely the four possible ways of understanding thing-events insofar as logic is concerned: “there is,” “there is not,” “both ‘there is’ and ‘there is not,’” and “neither ‘there is’ nor ‘there is not.’” This master is admonishing that as long as a monk's response is framed from within the logic of the everyday use of language, no answer is forthcoming. Here the reader can sense that the scope and the meaning of “no-thought and no-image” has been expanded to include the logical use of language, not simply a rejection of oppositional thinking.

A further expansion of the scope and the meaning of “no” can be found in an instruction Zen Master Daie (Chin., Dàhuì;1089-1163) gives to his students, though it is given via negativa—when they attempt to discover a response to Joshū's “nothing.” (Yanagita, 1974, 181-2.) Prefacing his remark that “this one word [i.e., “no(-thing)”] is a cane that shatters numerous [instances of] erroneous knowledge and perception,” Daie instructs the students not to take “no[thing]” in the context of being or nonbeing by applying either-or logic. An appeal to discriminatory thinking based on the standpoint of [ego-]consciousness is of no use either. It is also unacceptable to appeal to bodily action, let alone to engage in a mere verbal exchange. Not even a metaphysical response will do either, for Daie states: “Do not throw it out into an empty-void where there is nothing. Do not swallow it where something is generated.” To seek an answer in a text is also out of the question.

What is evident in the above instructions is that the Zen practitioner must tackle this “no[thing]” by mobilizing the whole of his or her person in order to delve into the ground of his or her personhood, where the “whole” in question involves both the mind and the body, both the consciousness and the unconscious. This is, no doubt, an existential challenge to the Zen practitioners, and so they make an all-out effort, staking life and death, because it guarantees them an embodiment of truth and freedom. In this context, Zen metaphorically speaks of reaching the whole as “kicking through the bottom of a bucket” to designate the ground of a person, which Zen understands to be bottomless. That is, it understands this ground to have “no” bottom, i.e., it is a bottomless ground. To avoid the danger of interpreting this ground nihilistically or relativisitically, the modern Japanese thinker, Nishida Kitarō (1870-1945) adds that it is absolutely nothing, where “absolutely” means cutting off all pairs of polar opposites.

5.3 Zen “Seeing”

The experiential dimension in which Zen's “nothing” becomes understandable refers to a quiescent state of meditation in which is arrested the activity of an individual practitioner's ego-consciousness that functions in a close correlation with his or her body. Upon reaching such a meditational state, the Zen practitioner comes to experience an event generally known as “seeing into one's nature” (kenshō), an initial satori experience. Although this phrase may on the surface suggest a dualistic state, namely that there is something that is called “nature,” which the Zen practitioner sees as an object, it refers to an experiential fact that seeing has turned into one's nature (according to the interpretation vis-à-vis the acquired enlightenment), or that one's nature is seeing (according to the interpretation vis-à-vis the original enlightenment). The Zen tradition interprets “nature” to be “buddha-nature,” i.e., a possibility to be awakened from the fundamental ignorance (i.e., to become a Buddha), and the way of its being is designated by the term tathatā, suchness or a thing-event's being such that it is in its primordial mode of being. When this aspect of knowledge is emphasized, Zen calls it “original” or “natural” knowledge. In this connection, it contends that the “seeing” is “not two,” i.e., it is non-dualistic in nature.

To illustrate an experiential basis for the above observation, we may cite another example, namely Dōgen's enlightenment experience. This will aid the reader to catch a glimpse of an experiential meaning of “not two,” for it is descriptive of the experience itself. He expresses it as “dropping off the body and the mind” (shinjin datsuraku). (In order to get an idea of this experience, one may also consult out-of-body experiences.) The experience of “dropping off the body and the mind” informs us that the dualistic relationship between the mind and the body has disappeared and by implication “I” and others, and “I” and nature. Hence they are “not two.” If the distinction has disappeared, it implies that the Zen practitioner is thrown into a non-dualistic domain of experience. It points to a practical transcendence from the everyday either-or, ego-logical, dualistic standpoint.

In light of the outer-inner distinction Zen interprets the non-dualistic experience to mean that the distinction has been epistemologically collapsed, as it arises in such a way to respond to the dualistic perspective from which the outer and the inner worlds appeared. It understands this collapsing of the distinction then to be the meaning of “not two,” from which an holistic perspective emerges. Conceptually Zen takes this holistic perspective to mean the de-substantialization of any two polar concepts, such as one and many, being and non-being, universal and particular, absolute and relative, transcendence and immanence, and birth and death. Zen's observation is that each of the polar terms is non-dualistically related to each of the other polar terms such that they are connected with, interdependent on, and relative to, each other for their meaning. They are thrown into an holistic context of an interdependent causal series. And for this series to be operative, Zen maintains that each of these terms that enters the relationship is empty of self-nature, where self-nature means a power to generate itself on its own without dependence on anything. For if thing-events designated by these terms are endowed with self-nature, they cannot enter into the series; what enters such a series is only an accidental attribute or property.

In order to give a still more concrete sense of what Zen-seeing is like, we now return to the question of how Zen understands the experiential meaning of “seeing into one's nature.” Zen's contention is that the bottomless ground is that which non-dualistically “sees” when the practitioner experiences the state of nothing, (or no-thought and no-image). How then does Zen articulate this “seeing”? This question points to an examination of the epistemic structure of how knowledge operates in Zen experience. For this purpose, the following Zen dialogue between Jinne and Chōsetsu concerning “no-thought” is illuminating. Although it is lengthy, I will quote it in full as it also provides a sense of how a Zen dialogue unfolds:

The disciple asks: What then is it [i.e., no-thought]?

The master replies: It is nothing like “what is.” Therefore, we can not explain “no-thought.” The reason why I am speaking about it now is because you have asked about it. If you haven’t asked about it, there is no need to explain it. Suppose that there is a clear, transparent mirror. If it does not face a thing, no image is reflected in it. To say that it mirrors an image means that because it faces something, it just mirrors its image.

The disciple asks: If it does not face any thing, is there or is there not a reflection in the mirror?

The master replies: That the mirror reflects a thing means that it always mirrors regardless of whether it is facing or not facing a thing.

The disciple asks: If there is no image and since you do not give an explanation, how can all beings and nonbeings become an issue? Now when you say that it always mirrors, how does it mirror?

The master replies: When I say that the mirror always mirrors, it is because a clear, transparent mirror possesses an original nature as its essential activity of always mirroring things. Analogously, people's mind is originally undefiled, and naturally possesses a superb light of wisdom that illuminates the perfect world of nirvāna.

The disciple asks: Insofar as people's minds are originally like that, when do people get it?

The master replies: It just sees nothing.

The disciple asks: When it is nothing, what can it see?

The master replies: Seeing is not like something you can call a thing.

The disciple asks: If it is not like anything one can call a thing, what does it see?

The master replies: it sees no-thing. That is the true seeing. It always sees.

(Yanagita, 1974, 132-3.)

Unlike most Zen dialogues that are often enigmatic and puzzling to those people who stand outside of this tradition, this dialogue provides a kind explanation in elucidating what “seeing” is like in Zen experience. This “seeing” is said to be “seeing nothing or no-thing,” and Jinne speaks of it by appealing to the analogy of a mirror, although he makes a disclaimer that it cannot adequately be explained in words. To get a glimpse of what he means by “seeing,” it is helpful to take note of the following points regarding this analogy. Jinne conceives of a mirror in terms of two modalities: the mirror in and of itself and the mirror as it engages an object other than itself. Both are understood in light of their activity. He characterizes the “original nature” of the mirror in and of itself as being “clear, transparent” (or “undefiled), wherein it is said to always mirror. “Original” means that it is not contingent on experience, while “always” refers to the mirror's ceaseless activity of mirroring. Whether “there is” or “there is not” a specific object to mirror is a contingent matter for the mirror in and of itself. What makes a mirror the mirror that it is is its activity of always mirroring, and when considered in and of itself, it possesses no specific image to mirror. There is no characteristic to it and hence no image appearing in it, i.e., “no-thought” or “no-image.” This is the meaning of “no-thing or nothing” in the phrase “seeing no-thing or nothing.” In other words, the mirror is turned into nothing, or to use the earlier phrase, the bottomless ground is nothing except, epistemologically speaking, its capacity to mirror, and even this capacity is rendered “nothing” when it is in no use.

Zen explains the fact that the mirror “just sees no-thing or nothing” when its act of seeing is mobilized in “facing” a thing. The adverb “just” is crucial. “Just” here means without discrimination, without superimposition, without projection, or in short, without positing an ego-consciousness as that which sees. Zen maintains that these characterizations obtain because the Zen practitioner “kicked through the bottom of the bucket,” a practical transcendence. In other words, Zen's contention is that there is no determination whatsoever in the mirror's activity of “just seeing.” That there is no determination means to Zen that the bottomless ground is nothing. When these qualifications are taken together, Zen interprets “just seeing no-thing or nothing” to mean seeing or mirroring things without discrimination, that is, with a sense of equality. When a mirror for example reflects an image of a beautiful object, it does not make any discriminatory value judgment that it is beautiful. And neither does it make any discriminatory value judgment when it mirrors an ugly object. It mirrors thing-events as they are. That is, the mirror does not take any stance of likes and dislikes; it does not take a stance of “for” or “against.” It is non-egological in mirroring each thing equally. Moreover, Zen observes that the nature of the mirror is such that it does not change due to the kind of object it mirrors. For example, it does not increase or decrease in size in virtue of the fact that it mirrors an object. (Bankei, for example, expresses it as the “unborn.”) It remains as it is in its original nature of always mirroring, which highlights the fact that it is clear and transparent. Because equality is the characteristic of this seeing, Zen speaks of the activity of this seeing as nondiscriminatory. Yet, because an object is mirrored as object, whether beautiful or ugly, Zen considers the act of mirroring to be a “discernment.” Therefore, Zen characterizes the “seeing” in “seeing no-thing or nothing” in its act-aspect as a discernment vis-à-vis nondiscrimination (mubunbetsu no funbetsu). This, Jinne says, is “true seeing,” which is non-discriminatory wisdom (prajñā). The obvious point Zen wants to make through this analogy is that the minds of people are analogously the same in their original nature and activity. Zen summarizes all of the above characteristics of seeing by employing a simple phrase: “motion in stillness” (seichū no dō). However, an objection may be raised contra Zen's holistic, non-dualistic meaning of its “seeing” or “mirroring,” namely the objection that if there is something that is mirrored, is there not still operative a dualistic epistemological structure? Zen would respond that this objection ignores the fact that the ground of seeing is the bottomless ground that is nothing. What appears against mirror qua nothing is just an object. In such a seeing, the object alone shines forth. Hence, it is characterized, to use Nishida's terminology, as “seeing without a seer.”

Although it may sound paradoxical, Zen maintains that this ground is also a fount of creativity. Because there is no determination in the ground, it is pregnant with many possibilities to be realized. Zen maintains, via the influences from philosophical Daoism, that this creativity is in the same order as that of nature, for the practitioner reaches the original source prior to the distinction between the outer world and the inner world. (Hence, Zen understands the human being to be “a being-in-nature.”) It often uses the phrase “no-mind” (Jpn., mushin; Skrt. nirodha-samāpatti) to generally designate the above experiential dimension. However, Zen does not mean it to be a mindless state, much less losing the mind. Nor does it mean a disappearance of the mind. Rather it designates a dimension of experience in which the ego-logically discriminatory activity of the mind disappears. This is, Zen maintains, because the Zen practitioner trans-descends into, and hence transcends, the ego-logically discriminatory activity of the mind which, Zen contends, arises due to adhering to “name-form” (Jpn., myōshiki; Skrt., nāmrūpa). This transcendence results in a rejection of the belief that there is a reality corresponding to a name. Through the state of no-mind, Zen observes that each individual thing that is mirrored is recognized for the first time to be individual qua the individual with a sense of equality that is due to other individual things.

6. Zen's Understanding of Time and Space

Given Zen's seeing as articulated above, one may entertain a natural question: how does Zen understand time and space? Are they significantly different from time and space as conceived by many other theories of time and space? In what follows, we will briefly provide how Zen understands “here and now,” “timelessness and spacelessness,” and “an integrated time and space.”

6.1 Here and Now

In spite of, or rather because of the above-mentioned experiential dimension of Zen-seeing, Zen insists that the Zen practitioner plant his or her feet in the everydayness of “here and now.” In this respect, Zen philosophically advocates a position of “not one.” Otherwise, it fears that the practitioner remains in the stillness of meditation, while suspending judgment for action. How then does Zen understand “here and now”? In this connection, one may reasonably ask: “how far and wide is ‘here’ and how long is ‘now,’” when Zen speaks of “here and now.” Are they each limited by a present perceptual experience? In the case of “now,” for example, is it an internal phenomenon of consciousness that allows the practitioner to experience time sometimes as a “memory” (or retention) and some other times as “anticipation” (or “protention”) in the ever flowing stream of “present” (e.g., St. Augustine, Husserl and Merleau-Ponty)? And in the case of “here,” is it delimited by the practitioner's spatial range of perception within the sensory field, situating the Zen practitioner as the point of reference? (There is in both cases a suggestion of involvement of the autonomous activity of the unconscious, of which Zen demands we must stand outside.) Zen's response to both of these questions is a resounding “Yes!” and “No!” however contradictory it may sound. “Yes,” because the practitioner, while living, cannot depart from the “here and now,” because he or she is incarnate, in which case time and space is always experienced as “here and now.” “No,” insofar as the perceptual model implies an ego-logical “human, all too human” stance (Nietzsche) with its attendant limitations, even though Zen does not exclude this model as long as it is not delimited by the dualistic, either-or ego-logical perspective. In the everyday human world that is “here and now,” Zen maintains that “riddhi and [its] wondrous activity all shoulder water and carry firewood” where “riddhi” refers to a power that naturally becomes available to the practitioner through the practice of meditation.

6.2 Timelessness and Spacelessness

Yet Zen thinks that the preceding is still a partial understanding of “here and now.” To fully understand it, it is helpful to examine the following often-quoted phrase, as it is particularly illustrative. Zen demands the practitioner “to show one's original face before one's parents were born.” This demand points to an experiential dimension prior to the bifurcation between the subject and the object—and hence “not two”—where “prior” means negation of the spatial-temporal ordering principles such as in Kant's understanding of time and space as a priori forms of intuition. It points to a non-dualistic experiential dimension that is timeless (or zero time) and spaceless (or zero space), by which Zen means that neither time nor space is a delimiting condition for Zen-seeing. In timelessness there is no distinction between past, present and future or between “before” and “after”; in spacelessness there is no distinction between the whole and its parts. One can also say that both time and space, experienced from the point-of-view of the everyday standpoint, is relativized when timelessness temporizes and spacelessness spatializes, where timelessness and spacelessness characterize the bottomless ground. Accordingly, Zen contends that timelessness and spacelessness are the natural and original zone of all things including human beings, for they are all grounded in it. Taking these points together, the Zen enlightenment experience suggests a leap from a causal temporal series.

Consequently, Zen contends that “here and now” is enfolded in both timelessness and spacelessness. This means that one time contains all times and one part contains the whole, as in the case of a holographic dry plate in which a part contains the whole. Seen in this manner, “now” for the Zen person is a temporalization of timelessness, while “here” is equally a spatialization of spacelessness, even though he or she may be anchored in the perceptual field as understood above. In other words, for the Zen person both “now” and “here” are experienced as an expression of thing-events in their suchness, because, as mentioned in the foregoing, Zen takes timelessness and spacelessnes to be the original abode of thing-events. Caution must be exercised here, however. Zen's timelessness should not be confounded with the idea of eternity standing outside a temporal series (e.g., Thomas Aquinas, Newton's “absolute time”) by means of a logical or intellectual transcendence, nor the spacelessness to be identified with “absolute space” (e.g., Newton) wherein there is no content of experience. In other words, Zen does not understand time and space by imposing a formal category on them, by presupposing in advance a form-matter distinction.

6.3 An Integrated Time and Space

Zen makes another equally important contention through this abstention, namely that time and space are lived as integrated space-time in the interfusion of a concrete temporalization and spatialization. For example, Dōgen speaks of it as “being-time” (u-ji) to indicate their inseparability; being cannot be apart from time, and time cannot be apart from being, where a being spatializes through the process of temporalization, and where it temporalizes through the process of spatialization. This is a concrete spatialization-temporalization that is lived without any intellectual abstraction, reflecting the Buddhist position that everything, excluding no-thing, is impermanent. Zen abhors an intellectual abstraction that merely thinks time and space. This is because the Zen person rides on the rhythm of living nature. That is, “here and now” is one experience (and hence “not two”), and for this reason they should be designated as “here-now.”

In living this integrated, living space-time, Zen does not understand time to be a quantifiable and homogeneously punctuated unit (i.e., the clock time of natural science), nor does it conceive of it as a linear progression from past to future through the present, although it does not exclude them insofar as they are useful for everyday life. The negation of the linear idea of time also includes the negation of the idea of time as symmetrical as well as reversible, because in the Zen experience of space-time, a teleological intentionality, an “in order that,” is absent. Yet, Zen does not accept, time as a “fleeing image of eternity” (i.e., Plato). Zen takes time to be living. According to Zen, theories of time built through conceptual abstraction, are distanced and separate from the immediacy of “here-now.”

Space, too, is neither a container (i.e., Newtown's “absolute space”) nor an a priori limiting condition (i.e., Kant), nor the place of displacement for the volume of an extended thing (i.e., Aristotle). Rather it is a living space. Dōgen for example captures this sense of space as “the bird flies the sky and the sky flies the bird.” In this statement an independence of both the sky and the bird is recognized, but it also recognizes that the sky and the bird each become themselves only through their interdependence. In other words, what makes this space a living space is the dynamic, interdependent, bilateral play of both bird and sky, from which the living space-time as “here-now” emerges as an ambience, where each of the terms entering the relationship through the activity is granted a full recognition of their being. This is because the Zen person lives the dynamic activity of non-dualistic “coming-together” of “the two,” whether this “two” happens to involve the “betweenness” of two individuals, individual and nature, or individual and trans-individual.

7. Returning to the Everyday “life-world”: Not One

If we are to stop at sketching what Zen-seeing is together with its understanding of time and space as an integrated space-time, Zen fears there occurs a danger of fixing the stance thus “obtained,”—although we must keep in mind that Zen “obtains” the stance of “not two” in such a way that it cannot be obtained, for in the non-dualistic dimension nothing can be “obtained.” However, Zen also recognizes at the same time that any stance that is fixed is one-sided and partial. It will deprive Zen, for example, of an opportunity to utilize Zen-seeing in the actions of everyday life. For this reason, Zen insists that the practitioner move to the stance of “not one.” What then is Zen's stance of “not one”? This question affords the reader, for the purpose of the present essay, to get a glimpse into Zen's movement from “not two” to “not one,” although in actuality this movement operates in a dynamic bilateral movement between them. This movement is symbolized in Zen by a circle, an image of the whole, which is also an image of perfection. Insofar as “one” is a negation of “not two,” “not one” then brings the Zen practitioner back to the everyday “life-world,” the world of multiplicity that is ordinarily constructed either-or ego-logically and dualistically.

7.1 Zen Person

For the Zen person, the move from “not two” to “not one” is an issue of concretely instantiating in the everyday “life-world” what is experienced through the stance of “not two.” This point, for example, is well illustrated in the following Zen dialogue between Zen Master Ungen (Chin. Yúnyán, 780-841) and a fellow practitioner, Dōgo (Chin., Dàowú; 769-835). It runs as follows:

Dōgo: Who are you going to serve the tea you are preparing?

Ungen: There is one person who wants it.

Dōgo: Can’t the person who wants it make the tea himself?

Ungen: Fortunately, I am here to do it for him. (Ueda, 1981, 165-66.)

This dialogue points to an activity of “trans-individual qua the individual,” where the “trans-individual” designates a Zen person with nondiscriminatory wisdom, while the “individual” designates those who remain in the everyday “life-world”. (In the above quote, the former is designated by the phrase “one person,” while the latter by the pronoun “you.”) However, in the everyday human “life-world,” the “trans-individual” cannot “make the tea himself,” because he is not incarnate like the individual who remains in the dualistic, either-or ego-logical, everyday standpoint. This is because he or she is one who follows the non-dualistic, non-ego-logical standpoint having practically transcended the former. This creates the dilemma of how to be trans-individual while assuming the form of an individual. If this is not properly dealt with, Zen warns that it results in developing a pathological condition or a mana-personality. For this reason, Ungen says “fortunately ‘I’ am here to do it for him.” Here, Zen conceives of the relationship between the individual and the trans-individual as one, i.e., “not two,” and yet they are “not one.” Insofar as both the trans-individual and the individual refer to the same person (in the above quote, “I”), they are “not two,” but insofar as their stances operate differently, they are “not one” (“I” and “him” in the quote). “Both individual and trans-individual” designates a harmonious assimilation of the two stances, a consequence of which is a person who can avail him or herself of both of these perspectives, i.e., the dualistic world of the everyday life and the non-dualistic world of “not two.” On the other hand, “neither individual nor trans-individual” refers to a person who cannot be pinned down or delimited by linguistic means. In spite of, or because of this, such a person is a carrier of freedom who goes beyond these perspectives, i.e., an person in whom the trans-individual and individual have disappeared in action, in which case the individual qua trans-individual is no longer ordinary, but extraordinary. Yet, he or she is quite ordinary in appearance. All of these points are synthesized into a Zen person.

7.2 Zen's Freedom

How then does the Zen person, thus understood, live freedom? The term that Zen uses to express the idea of “freedom” is “jiyū” and it consists of two characters; “ji” meaning “self on its own,” while “yū” means “out of.” When they are used together as a compound, the phrase as a whole designates an action arising out of self on its own. This action then carries a sense of spontaneity, much like the spontaneous creative act of living nature. This idea of freedom is foreign to Western intellectual tradition, however. For example, consider how freedom is defined by British empiricists like John Locke. According to Locke, freedom (or to be specific, liberty) is defined as a lack or absence of external constraint. According to this model, freedom is to express an ego-desire save in the name of will arising from an individual in “the state of nature” where and when there is no external constraint. By contrast, because it arises out of the self on its own, where the self in Zen is a groundless ground that is nothing, Zen's free action is not delimited by ego-desire, because it arises out of nothing. It “kicks through the bottom of the bucket,” that is, it purifies all the “defilements” interlaced with the activity of the ego-consciousness, as well as the personal and collective unconscious. For this reason, there is no issue involved in the Zen person's action that addresses the will of ego-consciousness. For what motivates the Zen person to action is a thrust he or she feels, surging from the creative source in the bottomless ground. Moreover, the Zen person does not experience, as Nietzsche has it, “bad-faith” or “self-deception” when explaining a motivation for action as a rationalist would, because a rationalist must rationalize an irrational desire rooted in the body and the unconscious. (See, for example, Nietzsche's Beyond Good and Evil.)

Does this mean then that the Zen person has eliminated the demand of instincts or desires? If they are eliminated, the Zen person would turn into a living corpse. Such a person can perform no action, let alone a free action. Obviously then, the Zen person does not eliminate them, but rather transforms them into “non-defilements,” into a higher spiritual energy. We see a heightened spirituality upheld by Zen master Baso (Chin., MÄzū; 709-788), which he insists to be concretely expressed in the everyday “life-world.” He expresses it by phrasing it: “the mind as it is is the way.” (Yanagita, 1974, 147.) This statement, “the mind as it is is the way” (heijōshin kore michi) is sometimes rendered in English as “the everyday mind is the way.” This rendition can be misleading if we ignore Baso's qualification that this “everyday mind” operates without defilements such that it is not “[entrenched in the samsāric cycle] of birth and death,” and moreover that it is not dominated by a teleological intentionality, i.e., it negates the “in order that.” Otherwise, there is a danger of interpreting Baso's statement as promoting an evil naturalism. That is, whatever a person desires in the state of “nature,” i.e., “the everyday mind,” is the expression of the Way. There is no problem of a misinterpretation then, as long as Baso's “everyday mind” is understood to mean the mind which is freed from “the samsāsric cycle of birth and death,” and yet it is the mind which is concretely instantiated in the everydayness of a human everyday “life-world.”

Let us see how Baso's idea of “the mind as it is is the way” is carried to a highly artistic action, whether it be a performance technique of martial artist, dancer, actor/actress or musician. Takuan's reflection on this point is illuminating. He speaks of a “nondiscriminatory knowledge” realized in action as “immovable wisdom”: “It [immovable wisdom] moves as the mind is wont to move: forward or back, to the left, to the right, in the ten directions and to the eight points; and the mind that does not stop at all is called immovable wisdom.” (Takuan, 1986.) Zen's free action is predicated on the fact that the mind “does not stop at all,” what Takuan paradoxically calls “immovable wisdom.” Here one can discern an echo of Jinne's mirror analogy. Takuan calls it “immovable” because the mind remains absolutely still (i.e., not two) in the midst of action, like the stationary shaft of a top. Such a mind does not fluctuate in its center, in the deep region of psyche. In this state, because the mind moves in such a way that it does not dwell on anything, there is no obstruction for the mind to move freely.

Generally Zen describes the freedom of bodily movement as “stillness in motion” (dōchū no sei) and is contrasted with “motion in stillness.” It is noteworthy that “stillness in motion” cannot accurately be analyzed by appealing to the active-passive scheme, which presupposes a dichotomy as a proper method for understanding. However contradictory it may seem, this is a description of how Zen understands its freedom as expressed through an integrated mind and body. In order for this sense of freedom to be embodied, however, Zen emphasizes that a performer of any kind repeatedly undergoes mind-body training. Takuan calls this the “body's learning,”—that is the core meaning of self-cultivation—because in “body's learning,” both the mind and the body are brought to action in one integrated whole. (The “body's learning,” neurophysiologically speaking, is closely related to an activity of the cerebellum in conjunction with the hippocampus, although it is only that.) When a skill or performing technique is learned through this method, one's own body moves freely as it is habituated to move without waiting for a command from the mind. This describes a freedom of action in a Zen person for whom the mind is completely assimilated into the object-body, while the body is equally rendered into the subject-body. They are one. At such a time, Takuan says, a spiritual life-energy of psychophysiological nature, called “ki,” permeates “one's body”—an energy that cannot be delineated by either the mind or the body. (Yuasa, 1993) In this connection, Zen also speaks of Zen's free action as a purposeless purpose, as an actionless action, for neither the purpose nor the action arises from the everyday consciousness which sets up a purpose or a goal for action. Zen calls it “samādhi-at-play,” where there is no individual qua the trans-individual, but what there is is just “play,” for the Zen person is absorbed in the activity when engaging a thing of the everyday “life-world.” In short, Zen freedom designates a term of achievement. What Zen says of freedom of action has an implication for every action people perform in daily life, from the simple act of opening a door to the magnificent play of a great athlete or performer of any kind. In them, Zen contends however, the spirituality of a performer must be expressed. Zen extends an invitation to all of us to act in this way, so that the quality of life will be enhanced with a sense of satisfaction and fulfillment, free from stress and anxiety.

8. Concluding Remarks

This essay has articulated a Zen Philosophy, though as anti-philosophy, by thematizing such topics as “overcoming dualism,” “Zen-seeing,” “Zen's understanding of time and space,” “Zen person,” and “Zen freedom,” in which process is noted a sense of the movement from “not two” to “not one.” This was to indicate Zen's sense of achieving personhood. Zen's methods of meditative practice are concrete ways for an individual to become a Zen person by awakening to the fundamental reality in the everyday human “life-world.” In so doing, it teaches to participate in the whole, and to express freedom in daily action, by showing one's “original face” right here-now and right in front of one's eyes.

In closing this essay, a cautionary remark is in order, however: all of the preceding accounts are simply a heuristic way of conceptually articulating Zen philosophy. Or to use a Zen phrase, this conceptual articulation is only “a finger pointing to the moon,” where Zen insists that there should not be a confounding of the moon with a finger. In Zen language, the moon metaphorically designates an experience of enlightenment and the finger a linguistic or reflective endeavor.

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Buddhism: Chinese | Japanese Philosophy: Kyoto School