Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy
This is a file in the archives of the Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy.

The Definition of Morality

First published Wed Apr 17, 2002; substantive revision Mon Feb 11, 2008

The term “morality” can be used either

  1. descriptively to refer to a code of conduct put forward by a society or,
    1. some other group, such as a religion, or
    2. accepted by an individual for her own behavior or
  2. normatively to refer to a code of conduct that, given specified conditions, would be put forward by all rational persons.

What “morality” is taken to refer to plays a crucial, although often unacknowledged, role in formulating ethical theories. To take “morality” to refer to an actually existing code of conduct put forward by a society results in a denial that there is a universal morality, one that applies to all human beings. Recently, some comparative and evolutionary psychologists (Haidt, Hauser, De Waal) have taken morality, or a close anticipation, to be present among groups of non-human animals, primarily other primates but not limited to them. “Morality” has also been taken to refer to any code of conduct that a person or group takes as most important.

Among those who use “morality” normatively, different specifications of the conditions under which all rational persons would put forward a code of conduct result in different kinds of moral theories. Some of these moral theories claim to put forward an account of morality that provides a guide to all rational beings, independent of whether these beings have any characteristics of human beings. Other moral theories claim that morality applies only to rational beings that have what they regard as the essential features of human beings. To claim that “morality” in the normative sense does not have any referent is to claim that there is no code of conduct that, under any plausible specified conditions, would be put forward by all rational persons, and results in one form of moral skepticism. Thus, although not widely discussed, what morality is taken to refer to has great significance for moral theories.

Dictionary definitions of referring terms are usually just descriptions of the important features of the referents of those terms. Insofar as the referents of a term share the features that account for why that term refers to those referents, the term is not regarded as ambiguous. “Morality” is an ambiguous term. What “morality” refers to when used in the descriptive sense does not have most of the important features of what “morality” refers to when used in the normative sense. Further, accepting a descriptive definition of morality need have no implications about how a person should behave. Accepting a normative definition of morality commits a person to regarding some behavior as immoral, perhaps even behavior that he is tempted to perform. Because accepting a normative definition of morality involves this commitment it is not surprising that there are serious disagreements about what normative definition to accept.

1. Descriptive Definitions of “morality”

“Morality” is an unusual word. It is not used very much, at least not without some qualification. People do sometimes talk about Christian morality, Nazi morality, or about the morality of the Greeks, but they seldom talk simply about morality all by itself. Consistent with this way of talking, many anthropologists used to claim that morality, like law, applies only within a society. They claimed that “morality” refers to that code of conduct that is put forward by a society. However, even in small homogeneous societies that have no written language, distinctions are made among morality, etiquette, law, and religion. So, even for these anthropologists “morality” does not often refer to every code of conduct put forward by a society. Morality is often distinguished from etiquette, law, and religion, all of which are, or involve, codes of conduct put forward by a society.

Etiquette is sometimes included as a part of morality, but it applies to norms that are considered less serious than the kinds of norms for behavior that are part of morality. Hobbes expresses the standard view when he discusses manners. “By manners I mean not here decency of behavior, as how one man should salute another, or how a man should wash his mouth or pick his teeth before company, and such other points of small morals, but those qualities of mankind that concern their living together in peace and unity.” (Leviathan, Chapter XI, paragraph 1)

Law or a legal system is distinguished from morality or a moral system by having explicit written rules, penalties, and officials who interpret the laws and apply the penalties. Although there is often considerable overlap in the conduct governed by morality and that governed by law, laws are often evaluated on moral grounds. Moral criticism is often used to support a change in the law. Some have even maintained that the interpretation of law must make use of morality (Dworkin).

Religion differs from morality or a moral system in that it includes stories, usually about supernatural beings, that are used to explain or justify the behavior that it prohibits or requires. There is often a considerable overlap in the conduct prohibited or required by religion and that prohibited or required by morality, but religions always prohibit or require more than is prohibited or required by guides to behavior that are explicitly labeled as moral guides. Sometimes morality is regarded as the code of conduct that is put forward by religion, but even when this is not the case, morality is thought by many to need some religious justification. However, just as with law, some religious practices and precepts are criticized on moral grounds, e.g., discrimination on the basis of race, gender, or sexual orientation. Morality is only a guide to conduct, whereas religion is always more than this.

When “morality” is used simply to refer to a code of conduct put forward by any actual group, including a society, whether or not it is distinguished from etiquette, law, and religion, then it is being used in a descriptive sense. It is also being used in the descriptive sense when it refers to important attitudes of individuals. Just as one can refer to the morality of the Greeks, so one can refer to the morality of a particular person. This descriptive use of “morality” is now becoming more prominent because of the work of psychologists (Haidt) who have been influenced by the views of David Hume, who tried to present a naturalistic account of moral judgments. In this century, R.M. Hare, in his earlier books (The Language of Morals, Freedom and Reason) regarded moral judgments as those judgments that override all nonmoral judgments and that the person would universalize. This account of moral judgments naturally leads to a view of morality as being concerned with behavior that a person regards as most important and wants everyone to adopt. Although all guides to behavior that are regarded as moralities involve avoiding and preventing harm to others, Hare's view of morality allows someone to claim that there are other features of morality that are more important. This view allows one to regard those features related to religious practices and precepts, or those features related to customs and traditions, whether or not they stem from religion, to be more important than avoiding and preventing harm.

When “morality” is used in this descriptive sense, moralities can differ from each other quite extensively in their content and in the foundation that members of the society claim their morality to have. A society might have a morality that is primarily concerned with practices not related to whether other persons are harmed, but rather with what they regard as necessary for purity or sanctity. They may take as morally most important that certain rituals be performed or that certain sexual practices, e.g., homosexuality, be prohibited. They might claim that their morality, which is concerned primarily with purity and sanctity, is based on the commands of God. This view of morality results in some significant conflicts with a normative account of morality, where morality is primarily concerned with avoiding and preventing harm. Many religions condemn homosexual behavior as immoral, but those who hold that morality is primarily concerned with avoiding and preventing harm condemn religious discrimination against homosexuals as immoral.

A society might have a morality that takes accepting the traditions and customs of the society, including accepting authority and emphasizing loyalty to the group, as more important than avoiding and preventing harm. In addition to conflicts concerning homosexuality, this account of morality might not allow any behavior that shows loyalty to the preferred group to count as immoral behavior. This account may claim that if one acts out of loyalty to the preferred group, it is morally acceptable to cause significant harm to innocent people not in that group. Acting altruistically, at least with regard to those in the group, is almost equated with acting morally, regardless of its effects on those outside of the group. This kind of account is what seems to allow some comparative and evolutionary psychologists to regard non-human animals as acting in ways very similar to ways of acting that are regarded as moral (De Waal).

It is possible for a society to regard morality as being concerned primarily with practices that minimize the harms that all human beings can suffer, but all actual moralities seem to include more than this in their morality. Such a society might claim that their morality, in which minimizing the harms that all human beings can suffer is the primary concern, is based on some universal features of human nature or of all rational beings. Many philosophers favor a normative account of morality in which every feature of morality is based on avoiding and preventing harm for at least all moral agents, that is, those about whom moral judgments are legitimately made, but it is doubtful that any actual society has a morality that contains only this feature, especially if no special status is given to members of the society.

Nonetheless, this feature of morality, unlike the previous two features, i.e., purity and sanctity, or accepting authority and emphasizing loyalty, is included in everything that is regarded as morality in all societies. Since it can conflict with the previous two features of morality, there can be fundamental disagreements about what is the morally right way to behave. A society whose morality contains all three of these features is open to criticism by philosophers because in the same situation the different elements may require acting in different ways with no accepted way of determining which element take precedence. Those who accept a normative account of morality or who take the avoiding and preventing harm element of their morality to be most important use it to criticize the other elements of morality when they are in conflict with this element.

Some psychologists (Haidt) seem to take morality to include all three of these features and hold that different members of a society can and do take different features of morality as most important. Most societies have moralities that contain all three of the above features; most societies also claim that morality has all three of the above foundations, religion, tradition, and rational human nature. But, in the descriptive sense of “morality,” beyond some concern with avoiding and preventing harm to some others, there need be no common content, nor need there be any common justification that those who accept the morality claim for it. The only other features that all of the original descriptive moralities have in common is that they are put forward by a group, usually a society and they provide a guide for the behavior of the people in that group or society. In this descriptive sense of “morality,” morality might allow slavery or might allow some people with one skin color to behave in ways that those with a different skin color are not allowed to behave. In this descriptive sense of “morality,” it is not even essential that morality incorporate impartiality with regard to all moral agents, those people whose behavior is legitimately subject to moral judgments, or that it be universalizable in any significant way.

Although most philosophers do not use “morality” in any of these descriptive senses, some philosophers do. Ethical relativists are interested in these different moralities and claim that they are only kind of morality there is (Westermarck). They deny that there is any universal normative morality. Ethical relativists are not merely, or even primarily, making a linguistic claim about the proper use of the English word, “morality.” They hold that only when the term “morality” is used in this descriptive sense is there something that “morality” actually refers to, namely, a code of conduct put forward by a society. They claim that it is a mistake to take “morality” to refer to a universal code of conduct that, under any plausible conditions, would be endorsed by all rational persons. Although ethical relativists admit that many speakers of English use “morality” to refer to such a universal code of conduct, they claim such persons are mistaken in thinking that there is anything that is the referent of the word “morality” taken in that sense. The practice of Christian missionaries who caused serious problems in trying to change the sexual practices of the societies to which they came may have been one of the reasons why ethical relativism was put forward by anthropologists. Inappropriate generalization may have led them to deny that there is any universal morality that should be used by people in all societies to guide their own conduct and to make judgments about the conduct of others.

When “morality” refers to the codes of conduct of different societies, the features that are essential, in addition to some element related to avoiding and preventing harm, are that morality is a code of conduct that is put forward by a society and that members of that society use it as their guide to behavior. In this descriptive sense, “morality” can refer to codes of conduct of different societies with widely differing content, and still be used unambiguously in the same way that “law” is used unambiguously even though different societies have laws with widely differing content. However, there are now other descriptive senses of “morality.” In the sense most closely related to the original descriptive sense, “morality” refers to a guide to behavior put forward by some group other than a society, for example, a religious group. When the guide to conduct put forward by a religious group conflicts with the guide to conduct put forward by a society, it is not clear whether to say that there are conflicting moralities, conflicting elements within morality, or that the code of the religious group conflicts with morality. Members of the society that are also members of a religious group may regard both guides as elements of morality and differ with regard to which of the conflicting elements of the moral guide they regard as most important. There are likely to be significant moral disputes between those who regard different elements as more important.

In small homogeneous societies people do not belong to groups that put forward guides to behavior that conflict with the guide put forward by their society. A society is homogeneous if there is only one guide to behavior that is accepted by all members of the society and that is the code of conduct that is put forward by the society. For such societies there is no ambiguity about which guide “morality” refers to. However, in those large societies where people often belong to groups that put forward guides to behavior that conflict with the guide put forward by their society, members of the society do not always accept the guide put forward by their society. If they accept the conflicting guide of some other group to which they belong, often a religious group, rather than the guide put forward by their society, in cases of conflict they will regard those who follow the guide put forward by their society as acting immorally.

The original descriptive sense of “morality,” parallel to the descriptive senses of “etiquette” and “law,” had two essential features: that morality is a code of conduct that is put forward by a society and that members of that society accept it as a guide for their behavior. This reveals an ambiguity that was not recognized because of the concentration on small homogeneous societies. Does “morality” refer only to those guides to conduct put forward by a society, or does it refer to guides to conduct put forward by other groups as well? There is another related ambiguity if the code of conduct a society puts forward is not accepted as a guide to behavior by the members of that society. Which of these features should be taken as essential? The recognition that people in a society do not always accept the code of conduct their society puts forward presents problems for the original descriptive sense of “morality.” The code of conduct a society puts forward and the code of conduct that members of that society use as a guide to behavior may differ.

However, it is not useful to adopt a definition of “morality” as referring to the code of conduct accepted by the members of a society because in many large societies, not all members of the society accept the same code of conduct. Nor is it useful to adopt a somewhat more general definition of “morality” as the code of conduct accepted by the members of a group because it is not only possible, but also it is often the case, that not all members of any group accept the same code. A natural response to these problems is to switch attention from groups to individuals. If what is important is what code of conduct people accept, and members of a group do not always accept the same code of conduct, then why be concerned with groups at all?

This consideration led to the descriptive sense of “morality” referred to earlier according to which morality is that guide to behavior that is regarded by an individual as overriding and that he wants to be universally adopted. Understood in this way “morality” refers to a guide to behavior accepted by an individual rather than that put forward by a society or any other group. But “morality” does not refer to just any guide to behavior accepted by an individual; it is that guide to behavior that the individual accepts as his overriding guide, and wants everyone in his group to accept as their overriding guide as well. This sense of “morality” is a descriptive sense, because a person can refer to some other individual's morality without endorsing it. In this sense, like the original descriptive sense, morality has almost no limitations on content. Whatever guide to behavior an individual regards as overriding and wants to be accepted by everyone in his group is that individual's morality.

When people explicitly talk about the morality of a group other than their own or of a person other than themselves, it is usually clear that they are using “morality” in a descriptive sense. However, when a person simply claims that morality prohibits or requires a given action, then the term “morality” is genuinely ambiguous. It is not clear whether it refers to (1) a guide to behavior that is put forward by a society, either his own or some other society; (2) a guide that is put forward by a group, either one to which he belongs or another; or (3) a guide that a person, perhaps himself, regards as overriding and wants adopted by everyone in his group, or (4) is a universal guide that all rational persons would put forward for governing the behavior of all moral agents. When a person uses “morality” to refer to a guide to conduct put forward by a group, unless it is his own group, it is usually only being used in its descriptive sense. No one referring to morality in the descriptive sense of “morality” need be endorsing it. When “morality” refers to a guide to conduct accepted by an individual, unless that individual is himself, it is usually being used in its descriptive sense. However, if the individual is referring to his own morality, he is usually using it normatively, that is, claiming that all rational persons would put it forward. Only (4) is always used normatively but a person might hold that the morality referred to in (1), (2), or (3) is also the morality referred to in (4).

Following Aristotle, “ethics” is sometimes taken as referring to a more general guide to behavior that an individual adopts as his own guide to life, as long as it is a guide that one views as a proper guide for others. When a general guide to behavior that endorses self-interest as primary is put forward for all to follow because acting in one's self interest is taken as fostering the interests of all, then ethical egoism can be taken as a moral theory. However, the current philosophical practice is to take ethical egoism as a view that promotes acting in one's own self-interest even when this requires harming innocent people. In this sense, ethical egoism is a moral guide only in a purely technical philosophical sense. No non-philosopher would regard a guide to conduct that takes one's own self-interest as sanctioning harming innocent others as a moral guide, because no one would want anyone else, let along everyone else, to adopt this guide. Sidgwick, (Methods of Ethics) who regarded rational rules of conduct as moral rules, may have been the primary source of the current philosophical practice that includes “ethical egoism” as an ethical theory.

In any normal sense of “morality,” morality cannot be a guide to behavior that a person does not want others to adopt. However, there is a sense of “morality” such that it does refer to a code of conduct adopted by an individual for his own use, but which he does not require to be adopted by anyone else. This can occur when an individual adopts for himself a very demanding guide that he thinks may be too difficult for most to follow. However, this guide is correctly referred to as a morality only when the individual would be willing for others to adopt that code of conduct, but does not require that they do so, and so does not judge them to be immoral if they do not adopt it.

2. Normative Definitions of “morality”

When “morality” is used in its universal normative sense, it need not have either of the two features that are essential to moralities referred to by the original descriptive sense: that it be a code of conduct that is put forward by a society and that it be accepted as a guide to behavior by the members of that society. Indeed, it is possible that “morality” in the normative sense has never been put forward by any particular society, by any group at all, or even by any individual who regards it as overriding. “Morality” is thus an ambiguous word; the two essential features cited above, which are present in everything that is referred to by the original descriptive sense are not present when “morality” is used in its normative sense. The only feature that the descriptive and normative senses of “morality” have in common is that they refer to guides to behavior that involve, at least in part, avoiding and preventing harm to some others.

Those who claim that there is a universal code of conduct that all rational persons would put forward for governing the behavior of all moral agents need not hold that every society has a code of conduct that has those features that they claim morality must have. They can admit that the guides to behavior of some societies lack so many of the essential features of morality in the normative sense that it is incorrect to say that these societies even have a morality in a descriptive sense. They can also admit that many, perhaps all, societies have defective moralities, that although their guides to behavior have enough of the features of normative morality to be classified as descriptive moralities, they could not be put forward in their entirety by all rational persons.

Those who hold that that there is a universal code of conduct that all rational persons would put forward for governing the behavior of all moral agents do not claim that any actual society has or has ever had a guide to conduct that has all of the essential features of this universal code of conduct. “Natural law” theories of morality claim that it is possible for any normal adult in any society that has even a defective morality to know the general kinds of actions that morality prohibits, requires, discourages, encourages, and allows. They also claim that morality applies to all of these persons, not only those now living, but also those who lived in the past. These are not empirical claims about morality; they are claims about what is essential to morality, or about what is meant by “morality” when it is used normatively.

Other moral theories do not hold quite so strong a view about the universality of knowledge of morality, but many hold that morality is known to all who can be legitimately judged by it. Baier, Rawls and contractarians deny that there can be an esoteric morality, one that people can be judged by even though they do not know about it. For all of them, morality is a public system, that is, it is a system that is known to all those to whom it applies and it is not irrational for any of those to whom it applies to follow it. Moral judgments of blame thus differ from legal or religious judgments of blame in that they are not made about persons who are legitimately ignorant of what they are required to do. Act consequentialists seem to hold that everyone should know that they are morally required to act so as to bring about the best consequences, but even they do not think judgments of moral blame are appropriate if a person is legitimately ignorant of what action will bring about the best consequences (Singer). Parallel views seem to be held by rule consequentialists (Hooker).

On all accounts of morality, it is a code of conduct. However, on ethical or group relativist accounts or on individualistic accounts, apart from avoiding and preventing harm, morality has no special content or features that distinguishes it from nonmoral codes of conduct, such as law or religion. Just as a legal code of conduct can have almost any content, as long as it is capable of guiding behavior, and a religious code of conduct has no limits on content, all of the relativist and individualist accounts of morality, have almost no limit on the content of a moral code. However, for those such as Hobbes, (Leviathan and De Cive) who hold that morality is a code of conduct that all rational persons would put forward for governing the behavior of all moral agents, it has a fairly definite content. Kant, in accordance with the German word “moral” that is used to translate the English word “morality,” regards morality as applying to behavior that affects no one but the agent, but most of the behavior that he discusses is behavior that affects other people. Hobbes, Bentham, Mill, and most other non-religiously influenced philosophers writing in English limit morality to behavior that, directly or indirectly, affects others.

The differences in content among those philosophers who use “morality” to refer to a universal guide that all rational persons would put forward for governing the behavior of all moral agents are less significant than their similarities. For all of these philosophers, such as Kurt Baier, Philippa Foot, and Geoffrey Warnock, morality prohibits actions such as killing, causing pain, deceiving, and breaking promises. For some, morality also requires charitable actions, but it does not require a justification for not being charitable on every possible occasion in the same way that it requires a justification for any act of killing, causing pain, deceiving, and breaking promises. Both Kant and Mill mark this distinction by talking of duties of perfect obligation and duties of imperfect obligation. For others, morality only encourages charitable actions, and no justification is ever needed for not being charitable. Rather, being charitable is encouraged but not required; it is always morally good to be charitable, but it is not immoral not to be charitable.

Although morality is often taken to prohibit unnatural sexual activity, such a prohibition is not included in most accounts of morality as a universal guide that all rational persons would put forward for governing the behavior of all moral agents. On these accounts, as Hobbes said in both Leviathan and De Cive morality is concerned with promoting people living together in peace and harmony, not causing harm to others, and helping them. For most philosophers, the prohibitions against causing harm, directly or indirectly, are not taken as absolute. However, unlike most kinds of actions, a justification is needed for violating these prohibitions in order to avoid acting immorally. A strict deontology holds that it is never justified to violate some of these prohibitions, e.g., the prohibition against lying. Those who hold that the principle of utility provides the foundation of morality, such as Mill, hold that it is justified to violate moral rules only when the overall direct and indirect consequences would be better. However, all those who use morality in its normative sense agree that the kinds of actions that directly or indirectly harm other people, and the kinds of actions that prevent or relieve harms, are the kinds of actions with which morality is concerned.

The Natural Law tradition, from the Greeks to the present day holds that all rational persons know what kinds of actions morality prohibits, requires, discourages, encourages, and allows. They also hold that reason endorses acting morally. Some hold that it is irrational to act immorally, but all hold that it is never irrational to act morally. Even religious thinkers in this tradition, such as Aquinas, hold that morality is known to all those whose behavior is subject to moral judgment, whether or not they know of the revelations of Christianity. Hobbes, who is in the natural law tradition, accepts all of the standard moral virtues, but complains that “the writers of moral philosophy, though they acknowledge the same virtues and vices, yet not seeing wherein consisted their goodness, nor that they come to be praised as the means of peaceable, sociable, comfortable living, place them in the mediocrity of the passions.” (Leviathan, Chapter 15, paragraph 40) The differences among those philosophers who hold that there is a universal morality are primarily about the foundation of morality, not about its content.

Neither Kant nor Mill regarded themselves as inventing or creating a new morality. Rather both of them, like Hobbes, regarded themselves as providing a justification for the morality that is accepted by all. Mill explicitly says:

The intuitive, no less than what may be termed the inductive school of ethics, insists on the necessity of general laws. They both accept that the morality of an individual action is not a question of direct perception, but of the application of a law to an individual case. They recognize also, to a great extent, the same moral laws; but differ as to their evidence, and the source from which they derive their authority. (Utilitarianism, Chapter 1, paragraph 3)

According to Mill, Utilitarianism provides the foundation for morality. It explains and justifies the moral rules that are accepted by all. Kant also regards himself as performing a similar task, explaining and justifying a universal moral consciousness.

Some contemporary act consequentialists (Singer) claim that morality requires doing that act that would result in the best overall consequences, even though no human being can possibly know what act would result in the best overall consequences. For them, as well as for Kant, morality applies to omniscient beings as well as to fallible, vulnerable human beings. Some rule consequentialists (Hooker) claim that morality requires following that rule that would result in the best overall consequences if everyone followed or accepted it. Since different consequentialists, both act and rule consequentialists, differ in their views about what consequences count as best, consequentialism does not provide a guide to conduct that has what those who take morality to be a public system consider to be an essential feature, namely, that being subject to moral judgment is incompatible with unavoidable ignorance of what general kinds of actions morality prohibits, requires, discourages, encourages, and allows.

Some consequentialists claim that morality does not have as an essential feature that being subject to moral judgment requires knowing all of the general kinds of actions morality prohibits, etc. They claim that the right action is that which leads to the best consequences, regardless of whether anyone can know which action that is. It is interesting that these consequentialists usually talk about providing a criterion of rightness rather than a criterion of moral rightness, for no ordinary use of “moral rightness” refers to behavior that depends upon information that it is impossible for any human being to have.

Most consequentialists think that there is a correct answer to the question about what counts as the best consequences, but they may not realize the importance of the fact that until that correct answer is universally acknowledged, many moral agents do not know the kinds of actions morality prohibits, requires, discourages, encourages, and allows. Further, on some act consequentialist views no human being can ever know what action would have the best consequences. On these views, consequentialism provides a guide to conduct only in a theoretical sense, but it is not meant as a practical guide to conduct. Most consequentialists would not favor all persons doing that action that they consider to have the best consequences, for they know that human beings often make mistakes and have biases that distort their judgments.

In trying to provide a definition of what I take to be the ordinary normative sense of “morality,” that is, a moral system that is put forward by rational persons to be used by all moral agents in guiding their conduct, I find it useful to regard morality as a public system. I use the phrase, “public system” to refer to a guide to conduct such that (1) all persons to whom it applies, all those whose behavior is to be guided and judged by that system, know what behavior the system prohibits, requires, discourages, encourages, and allows; and (2) it is not irrational for any of these persons to accept being guided and judged by that system. What this means is that insofar as a person is legitimately ignorant of what he is morally prohibited or required to do, he is not subject to moral judgment. This is one way in which morality in the normative sense differs from law. Law is not a public system for sometimes “ignorance of the law provides no excuse.” Even if a person is legitimately ignorant of what he is legally prohibited or required to do, he may still be subject to legal judgment.

In ideal situations, card games such as bridge and poker, and athletic games such as baseball, soccer, and basketball are public systems, i.e., all those who are participating in the game know what behavior the game prohibits, requires, discourages, encourages, and allows and it is not irrational for them to act accordingly. Although children may participate in a game without knowing its point or all of the rules that apply to those playing the game, they are not usually held responsible for infractions of the rules about which they are legitimately ignorant. The ideal situation for a legal system is also that it be a public system, but in any large society that is not the case, and people are held legally responsible for following rules about which they are legitimately ignorant, and it is sometimes irrational for them to follow those rules. Games are closer to being public systems and most adults playing a game know the point of the game as well as the rules that are likely to apply to their behavior in the game. Although a game is often a public system, it applies only to those playing the game. If a person does not care enough about the game to abide by the rules, she can usually quit. Morality is the one public system that no rational person can quit. This is the point that Kant, without completely realizing it, captured by saying that morality is categorical. Morality applies to people simply by virtue of their being rational persons who know what morality prohibits, requires, etc. and can guide their behavior accordingly.

Since the normative sense of “morality” refers to a universal guide to behavior that all rational persons would put forward for governing the behavior of all moral agents, it is important to provide at least a brief account of what is meant by “rational person.” In this context, “rational person” is synonymous with “moral agent” and refers to those persons to whom morality applies. This includes all normal adults with sufficient knowledge and intelligence to understand what kinds of actions morality prohibits, requires, discourages, encourages, and allows, and with sufficient volitional ability to use morality as a guide for their behavior. Such persons must also seek to avoid any harm to themselves unless they believe that their action will result in someone, themselves or others, avoiding a comparable harm or gaining a compensating good. People lacking these characteristics are not subject to moral judgment. If they lack them only temporarily, they might be excused from moral judgments in those cases.

The following definition of morality incorporates all of the essential features of morality as a guide to behavior that all rational persons would put forward for governing the behavior of all moral agents. “Morality is an informal public system applying to all rational persons, governing behavior that affects others, and has the lessening of evil or harm as its goal.” In order to show that this definition incorporates all of the essential features of morality, I shall explain how the various parts of the definition incorporate these features.

Defining morality as a public system incorporates the essential feature that everyone who is subject to moral judgment knows what kinds of actions morality prohibits, requires, discourages, encourages, and allows. The definition of public system also guarantees that it is never irrational to act morally. That morality applies to all rational persons makes clear that the sense of “morality” being defined is that guide to conduct that applies to all rational persons. It would take considerably more space than is appropriate here to show that defining morality as a public system that applies to all rational persons also results in morality being a universal guide to behavior that all rational persons would put forward for governing the behavior of all moral agents. I should make clear that the claim that all rational persons would put forward this system only follows if some limitations are put on the beliefs that rational persons can use and if they are attempting to reach agreement with similarly limited rational persons.

To say that morality is an informal system means that it has no authoritative judges and no decision procedure that provides a unique guide to action in all moral situations. When it is important that disagreements be settled, societies use political and legal systems to supplement morality. These formal systems have the means to provide unique guides, but they do not provide the uniquely correct moral guide to the action that should be performed. That morality is a public system does not mean that everyone always agrees on all of their moral judgments, but only that all disagreements occur within a framework of agreement. Basketball can be a public system even if referees can, within limits, disagree in their judgments in calling fouls, but all players know that what the referees call a foul is a foul. For an informal public system such as morality, fully informed moral agents can, within limits, disagree in their moral judgments. When this disagreement is recognized, those who understand that morality is an informal public system regard how one should act as morally unresolvable, and the problem is transferred to the political or legal system. An important example of such a moral problem is whether fetuses are impartially protected by morality and so whether or under what conditions, abortions are allowed. There is continuing disagreement among fully informed moral agents about this moral question, even though the legal and political system in the United States has provided fairly clear guidelines about the conditions under which abortion is legally allowed. Despite this important and controversial issue, morality, like all informal public systems, presupposes agreement on how to act in most moral situations, e.g., all agree that morality does not allow killing or seriously harming any moral agent. No one thinks it is morally justified to cheat, deceive, injure, or kill a moral agent simply in order to gain sufficient money to take a fantastic vacation. In the vast majority of moral situations, given agreement on the facts, no one disagrees, but for this very reason, these situations are rarely discussed. Thus, the agreement on almost all moral matters, not only on what rules are moral rules, but also on when it is justified to violate one of these rules, is often overlooked.

The claim that morality only governs behavior that affects others is somewhat controversial. Some have claimed that morality governs behavior that affects only the agent herself. Examples of behavior that supposedly affects only oneself, often include taking recreational drugs, masturbation, and not developing one's talents. In these cases morality is sometimes taken to include behavior that affects only the agent herself. Kant may provide an accurate account of this concept of morality, which is more closely tied to its religious origin. However, when the concept of morality is more secular and morality is completely distinguished from religion, morality is taken as governing only that behavior that directly or indirectly affects others. It is likely that regarding self-affecting behavior as governed by morality is a holdover from the time when morality was not clearly distinguished from religion. This religious holdover might also affect the claim that some sexual practices such as homosexuality are immoral, but those who distinguish morality from religion do not regard homosexuality, per se, as a moral matter. Almost all American colleges and universities prohibit discrimination against homosexuals, and it is quite common for college and university officials, as well as other public officials, to condemn anti-gay behavior as immoral in the way similar to the way that they condemn racist behavior as immoral.

The final characteristic of morality — that it has the lessening of evil or harm as its goal — is also somewhat controversial. The Utilitarians talk about producing the greatest good as the goal of morality. However they include the lessening of harm as essential to producing the greatest good and almost all of their examples involve the avoiding or preventing of harm. The paradigm cases of moral precepts involve rules that prohibit causing harm directly or indirectly, such as rules prohibiting killing, causing pain, deceiving, and breaking promises. Even those precepts that require or encourage positive action, such as helping the needy, are almost always related to preventing or relieving harms. An examination of the paradigm examples of those moral precepts that are moral rules makes it clear that all of them are prohibitions of those kinds of actions that directly or indirectly cause harm to others; an examination of the paradigm examples of those moral precepts that are moral ideals makes it clear that all of them involve the prevention or lessening of harms. It would be possible to include these paradigm examples of moral precepts, e.g., do not kill, do not lie, and help the needy, in the normative definition of morality, but it not necessary to do so, because the proposed definition is sufficient to guarantee that these paradigm moral precepts will be part of morality, that is, the moral system that people actually use, often not consciously, in making their moral decisions and judgments. It should be clear that all rational persons would put forward these paradigm moral precepts to guide the behavior of all moral agents.

Referring terms are ambiguous when the referents of a term differ from each other in sufficiently important ways. The original descriptive definition of “morality” refers to an actual code of conduct put forward by a society and accepted by the members of that society. When the examination of large diverse societies raised problems for this original descriptive definition, different descriptive definitions were offered in which “morality” refers to a code of conduct put forward by any group, or even by any individual. Apart from containing some prohibitions on harming some others, different moralities can differ from each other quite extensively. Unlike the descriptive definitions of morality discussed earlier, which may have minimal implications for how a person should behave, the proposed normative definition of “morality” provides an explicit guide for how a person should behave. The proposed normative definition of “morality” is controversial but it does have some features that should be widely accepted. The definition allows as meaningful the commonly asked question, “Why should I be moral?” It is also compatible with the commonly held view that it is not always irrational to be immoral, however it guarantees that it is never irrational to be moral. This definition also explains why we want others to act morally and why others want us to act morally. It thus does what definitions of referring terms are supposed to do: it clarifies this term's relationship to other terms with which it is related, and helps to explain why we use the word in the way that we do.

Bibliography

Other Internet Resources

[Please contact the author with suggestions.]

Related Entries

consequentialism | ethics: natural law tradition | Hobbes, Thomas: moral and political philosophy | Kant, Immanuel | Mill, John Stuart | moral relativism