Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy
This is a file in the archives of the Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy.

Publicity

First published Wed Jan 12, 2005

Publicity can be opposed both to privacy and to secrecy. This entry will mostly be dealing with the latter meaning. In everyday life, calls for more transparency or openness in political and economic life may seem rather uncontroversial. Still, the precise reasons why and the extent to which publicity should be guaranteed are not straightforward. Moral and political philosophers, along with social scientists, have until now provided us with only fragmentary elements in this respect. We shall review here what has been gathered so far.

This entry unfolds in three parts. We start with hypothetical publicity, and singularly with Immanuel Kant's publicity test, contrasting his position with the one of Henry Sidgwick and looking both at the justification and implications of the Kantian test (Part I). More precisely, our focus in this first part will be on two questions. First, what (if anything) justifies the importance of this test? Second,what are its implications for moral and political philosophy in general and for actual publicity in particular? Hypothetical publicity may appear to some readers as the only genuinely philosophical development on publicity, which justifies the fact that we will examine it first.

We then look more closely at actual publicity, focusing on two moments of our political life (voting and deliberation) and two of its actors (citizens and representatives) (Part II). Authors such as John Stuart Mill and Jon Elster will be our guides here. Secret ballots have not always been the rule. Hence, shifting away from open vote gave rise to fascinating debates, especially in the British 19th century. We then move to the analysis of reasons for and against public deliberation, Elster's argument from the civilizing force of hypocrisy being our starting point here. At least two central questions should be kept in mind while reading this second part of the entry. First, are the arguments in favor of open/secret voting different from those in favor of open/secret deliberation? Second, how much weight should be attached, in philosophical arguments about publicity, to empirical claims, and have philosophers paid enough attention to relevant empirical complexities?

In a third (and shorter) section, we introduce the reader to a few dimensions of the concept of publicity as it is used in John Rawls's work. As for many other questions, Rawls has revived the topic. The ideas of “public rules” and “public reason” have now become important in political philosophy. We shall briefly present and discuss them.

1. Hypothetical Publicity

1.1 Kant's Hypothetical Publicity Test

Kant's hypothetical publicity test appears in the second appendix to his Zum ewigen Frieden (Perpetual Peace) (1795, 381).[1] He writes:

All actions relating to the right of other human beings are wrong if their maxim is incompatible with publicity.[2]

There are at least three interesting issues here. First, what is the justification for such a publicity test? Is there any reason to suspect any connection between the ability to stand publicity and the rightness of a position? Second, which maxims of action and, more generally, which moral theories are likely not to pass such a publicity test? Third, what does this test entail with regard to the need for actual publicity? Answering each of these questions requires some degree of hermeneutics, especially when it comes to inferring the meaning of words such as “incompatible” and “publicity”.

Some interpretation issues can be quickly disposed of. First, the Kantian test applies specifically to political maxims and is the equivalent in that sphere of the more general categorical imperative.[3] This is why Kant refers to it as the “transcendental principle of the publicity of public law” (1795: 382). Second, it is plausible to read the Kantian test as a merely negative one: whether a maxim would pass the test only means that one necessary condition for its rightness has been satisfied. It will therefore not be sufficient to guarantee that all successful maxims are right. This is suggested both by the expression “wrong if” and by Kant's explicit statement: “this principle is, furthermore, only negative, i.e., it only serves for the recognition of what is not just to others”.[4] Such a reading entails a difference with the categorical imperative insofar as the latter is a necessary and sufficient condition for permissibility. Third, it is also clear from the principle that neither an action itself, nor the actual motives underlying such an action (Davis 1991, 418) need to be able to be successfully disclosed in order to guarantee that they are not wrong. The test only applies to the maxim of such an action, which already indicates one respect in which such a hypothetical test could possibly leave room for actual secrecy. This is true notwithstanding the plausibility of Luban's following claim: “the best way to make sure that officials formulate policies that could withstand publicity is by increasing the likelihood that policies will withstand publicity”.[5]

Now, what does Kant mean when he uses the word “publicity”? Were we to face an actual public, we could give it a more or less demanding interpretation, ranging from merely general knowledge (each of us actually knows or is able to know) or mutual knowledge (each of us knows, and knows that the others know), to critical debate where what we know is being actively discussed (Luban 1996, 169-172). The latter form of publicity, while seeming much richer and appealing would probably not fit the Kantian text.[6] It could itself be understood in two ways. Either, publicity would be taken as a synonym of debateability, i.e., the fact that the maxim be such as to be deemed minimally appropriate for public discussion, in which case the test would probably not exclude much. Were it alternatively to be taken as referring to the ability of a maxim to pass the filter of actual public debate and be accepted by its participants, the test would then have a very contingent outcome, depending on the real public we are facing.

In fact, we can certainly try to ascertain whether publicity should be understood as general knowledge, mutual knowledge or publicity as the outcome of public debate.[7] What matters much more however, in the context of understanding the nature of the Kantian test, is that Kant is referring to an ideal and rational public.[8] The test is thus hypothetical, not only because it does not necessarily require actual publicity (as we shall see), but also because any outcome of actual publicity would inevitably remain at best a rough approximation of what the test would lead us to with an ideal public.[9]

With this reference to an ideal and rational public in mind, we may then proceed with the interpretation of the concept of incompatibility (Luban 1996, 172-176; Davis 1992, 170). The two notions should be understood jointly as Kant's following quote demonstrates: “A maxim which I cannot divulge without defeating my own purpose must be kept secret if it is to succeed; and, if I cannot publicly avow it without inevitably exciting universal opposition to my project, the necessary and universal opposition which can be foreseen a priori is due only to the injustice with which the maxim threatens everyone” (1795: 381). The idea of necessary opposition present here can hardly make sense if it is not used with reference to an ideal public. Now, in order to give substance to what such an incompatibility could mean more precisely, let us briefly turn to Sidgwick's views on covert utilitarianism before coming back to Kant.

1.2. Sidgwick on Covert Utilitarianism

As we shall see in Part II, classical utilitarians such as Bentham and especially John S. Mill were rather sympathetic to the idea of publicity. Still, it is also among utilitarians that we find one of the strongest principled defenses of secrecy. Sidgwick defends the idea that it may be necessary for utilitarianism to go under cover, and that this does not have to be considered unjust. In his Methods of Ethics (1874), he writes:

[…] on Utilitarian principles, it may be right to do and privately recommend, under certain circumstances, what it would not be right to advocate openly; it may be right to teach openly to one set of persons what it would be wrong to teach to others; it may be conceivably right to do, if it can be done with comparative secrecy, what it would be wrong to do in the face of the world; and even, if perfect secrecy can be reasonably expected, what it would be wrong to recommend by private advice or example […]. Thus the Utilitarian conclusion, carefully stated, would seem to be this; that the opinion that secrecy may render an action right which would not otherwise be so should itself be kept comparatively secret; and similarly it seems expedient that the doctrine that esoteric morality is expedient should itself be kept esoteric. Or if this concealment be difficult to maintain, it may be desirable that Common Sense should repudiate the doctrines which it is expedient to confine to an enlightened few. And thus a Utilitarian may reasonably desire, on Utilitarian principles, that some of his conclusions should be rejected by mankind generally; or even that the vulgar should keep aloof from his system as a whole, in so far as the inevitable indefiniteness and complexity of its calculations render it likely to lead to bad results in their hands (Sidgwick 1874, 487-489)

As in the Kantian case, Sidgwick not only deals with secret actions, but with the secrecy of doctrines underlying such actions. Two of his points are worth stressing. First, the relative confidentiality of a given practice or — more importantly for us — of its maxim may not only be acceptable, but may even be a necessary condition for the moral acceptability of such a practice — which is then the reverse of what Kant defends. Utilitarians may indeed consider some practices acceptable on the condition that they remain marginal. And keeping such practices confidential may be required for them not to spread around. Secrecy would thus not only be allowed in this case. It would also be required. Second, there is a doctrine of meta-secrecy at play as well, as Sidgwick's argument applies on top of actions to both maxims and meta-maxims. For him, the very idea that utilitarianism may allow and even require such covert actions should itself be kept relatively secret. As Luban puts it, “not only is it best if utilitarianism is not widely believed, but it is best if the very fact that the belief in utilitarianism has been suppressed by the “enlightened few” is not widely believed. This is no longer Government House utilitarianism. It is conspiratorial utilitarianism” (Luban 1996, 167).

1.3 Sidgwick's and Kant's Examples

1.3.1 Sidgwick on Celibacy and Lying

With the aim of identifying the exact implications of Kant's and Sidgwick's views, let us look first more closely at the examples they actually provide in the course of their discussion. We shall begin with Sidgwick who contrasts two cases: lying and celibacy.[10] The argument unfolds as follows. First, some types of behavior are only morally acceptable provided that they remain (very) restricted in scope.[11] If lying and celibacy were to become widely practiced, this would become a problem for utilitarians, according to Sidgwick. However, as long as they remain marginally practiced to an extent that is justified on utilitarian grounds, they should be accepted. Second, the question arises as to whether we should recognize all this publicly. Albeit not raising any difficulty in the case of celibacy,[12] abandoning publicly an absolute prohibition on lying might not be acceptable for utilitarians. Sidgwick writes:

… assuming that general unveracity and general celibacy would both be evils of the worst kind, we may still all regard it as legitimate for men in general to remain celibate if they like, on account of the strength of the natural sentiments prompting to marriage, because the existence of these sentiments in ordinary human beings is not affected by the universal recognition of the legitimacy of celibacy: but we cannot similarly all regard it as legitimate for men to tell lies if they like, however strong the actually existing sentiment against lying may be, because as soon as this legitimacy is generally recognized the sentiment must be expected to decay and vanish (Sidgwick 1874, 486).

It is worth emphasizing that Sidgwick clearly states that the need for secrecy in the case of lying only arises because we are dealing with a general public that is not constituted only of enlightened utilitarians. For Sidgwick considers that “if therefore we were all enlightened Utilitarians, it would be impossible for any one to justify himself in making false statements while admitting it to be inexpedient for persons similarly conditioned to make them; as he would have no ground for believing that persons similarly conditioned would act differently from himself” (Sidgwick 1874, 486-487; Piper 1978, 190f). However, once we assume that we do not live in such an ideal world populated only with enlightened utilitarians, we may want to keep our complex moral rules secret in order to avoid counterproductive consequences from an utilitarian perspective. Such consequences may flow from various sources, such as a lack of time (e.g., people spending too much time finding out what the fair action would be), misunderstandings possibly due to inadequate cognitive abilities (e.g., construing too broadly the class of cases in which lying would be acceptable from a utilitarian point of view, leading to a spread of lying) or from distrust towards utilitarianism (e.g., principles having a larger number of exceptions generating more doubts about their cogency than elegant and exceptionless ones).

Notice moreover the difference between the Sidgwickian argument as illustrated by these two examples and another utilitarian argument that would justify “self-effacement”, i.e., the idea that to remain able to reach its goals, utilitarianism should go totally undercover. In other words, even enlightened utilitarians should stop being motivated by it. The argument is the following one: being motivated by a utilitarian goal may impede our ability to actually reach this very goal. For instance, truly believing in the value of an artistic project independently of its ability to bring about happiness is more likely to generate welfare maximization than being motivated towards this project out of a commitment to utilitarianism. In other words, a society committed to utilitarian principles may well turn out to be a less happy one than a society relying on a given set of common sense principles. If this is true, we would not only have an argument, for “Government House utilitarianism” (i.e., for utilitarian principles being relied upon only by the enlightened few), or for its stronger “meta-secrecy” version (of which a few enlightened would still be aware). We would in fact have a case for something even more radical: the full self-effacement of utilitarianism for utilitarian reasons, i.e., even enlightened utilitarians would have to forget about it if they are really committed utilitarians.[13]

In short, Sidgwick's argument explicitly refers to a non-ideal public (“society as actually constituted”, “mankind in general” or “the vulgar”, as opposed to “an ideal community of enlightened Utilitarians”). And his view then has to do with a logic of confinement (necessary to preserve the practice's acceptability) requiring in cases such as legitimate lying — as opposed to celibacy — a certain degree of concealment given the fact that many of us are not enlightened utilitarians. In other words, several of the reasons for secrecy that could underlie Sidgwick's view on the lying case would not apply if we were all enlightened utilitarians. It is worth stressing however that, besides the “self-effacement” argument, Piper has argued that there may be utilitarian grounds for secrecy in an ideal community of enlightened utilitarians as well. For knowing that in such a society e.g., promises might not necessarily be kept — keeping them depending in each case on the outcome of a utilitarian calculus — will cause significant coordination problems due to lack of predictability of other people's action. In the absence of secrecy, such an ideal society would then become less efficient (Piper 1978, 198-199).

1.3.2 Kant on Rebellion and Secession

Interestingly enough, while Kant's test refers to an ideal public, the examples he provides us with have to do — as in Sidgwick's discussion — with a non-ideal public. As we shall see however, the mechanisms on which Kant's argument rest differ from those on which Sidgwick's does. Two cases are being envisaged: rebellion and secession. Let us begin with the former. Kant asks: “Is rebellion a legitimate means for a people to employ in throwing off the yoke of an alleged tyrant (non titulo, sed exercitio talis)?” (1795: 382). The publicity test is used here in two ways. First, Kant claims that the open acknowledgement of the maxim of rebellion “would make its own purpose impossible” (1795: 382). The argument is the following. A person cannot be said to be the chief if the people may sometimes employ force against him (chief-with-absolute-power assumption). The establishment of a state requires a chief in this sense (no-state-without-chief assumption). Therefore publicizing the maxim of rebellion would make the establishment of a state impossible. This is only valid however if we accept the two assumptions mentioned above. Second, the Chief himself may publish the maxim according to which rebellion will be sanctioned with death, “for when he knows he possesses irresistible power […] he need not fear vitiating his own purpose by publishing his maxims” (1795: 383). And it is because of such irresistibility that publishing this maxim will not be self-frustrating. Again, Kant does not say whether in a non-ideal situation in which nobody is in a position to have absolute power, the fact that publishing the same maxim would frustrate its very purpose would also mean that this is an unjust maxim. And what is also worth stressing is that such purpose frustration does not imply at all to approval by an ideal and rational public. It merely derives from power relations. Hence, were we to adopt the same line of argument, we could conclude that the stronger a despotic power, the larger the spectrum of maxims that may pass the publicity test, a conclusion that Kant implicitly endorses in the case of maxims of international law.[14]

The rebellion example illustrates the difficulty involved in moving from the hypothetical test to real life situations. What is at stake is clearly our understanding of what “compatibility” could plausibly mean once we move from an ideal to a non-ideal public. The tension in Kant's text is the following. As we keep reading the general part of his argument, it all looks as if reference is made to the universal acceptability of a maxim in the eyes of an ideal and rational public. The rebellion as well as the other examples he gives however (1795: 383-384) all rely on a “self-frustration” (or counter-productivity) mechanism. The latter may certainly have a direct connection with what it may be rational for the beneficiaries and victims of a maxim to do. Kant remains unclear however about the connection between such preoccupations and the just or unjust nature of a maxim.

Let us then take the secession example:

‘If a smaller State is situated as to break up the territory of a larger one, and continuous territory is necessary to the preservation of the larger, is the latter not justified in subjugating the smaller and incorporating it?’. We easily see that the greater power cannot afford to let this maxim become known; otherwise the smaller states would very early unite, or other powers would dispute the prey, and thus publicity would render this maxim impracticable. This is a sign that it is illegitimate (1795: 384).

Again, Kant refers here to the risk that defense strategies of the potential losers of a maxim's implementation may render the latter less efficacious, if not totally inefficacious. There are at least two difficulties with this. First, in a real life context (e.g. Cuba or Chechnya type) in which the large state knows that other small or large states are unlikely to intervene in such situations, publicity would not make the maxim impracticable. Hence, the maxim could in principle still be fair if we were to follow the Kantian logic. Second (and conversely), take a domestic analogy involving a state fighting a local mafia. Were the state to announce in advance that it will run a special anti-mafia operation on a given day, any benefits from a surprise intervention would vanish. In other words, a maxim stated precisely enough to include the date of the police intervention could not be publicized. All the local Mafiosi would seek to hide themselves on that very day, hence making the intervention totally useless. This will not suffice to convince us however — even if we were ideal and rational observers — that the planned police intervention (and the maxim on which it would be grounded) is unjust.

Both Sidgwick's and Kant's examples rely on non-ideal publics. Admittedly they do so in a slightly different manner. Kant's ideal public apparently sticks to the role of a judge whereas Sidgwick's ideal community of utilitarians is taken as a set of actors whose understanding of the rules is likely to affect their actual behavior. However, the reasons justifying secrecy in the examples each of them gives are of a very different nature. For Sidgwick's illustrations do not necessarily involve power relation problems. They rather imply motivational or cognitive dimensions. What matters as well for our purposes is that whereas the examples given by Sidgwick properly illustrate the logic of his argument, those provided by Kant do not really enlighten us further, for the idea of purpose frustration (or “self-frustration”) mobilized in the rebellion and secession cases is certainly not applicable once we shift to an ideal public. Therefore, we shall now rely on four examples distinct from those of Kant in order to ascertain the meaning and implications that could be attached to the Kantian test insofar as maxims that have to do with actual publicity are concerned.

1.4 Does the Kantian Test Prohibit Actual Secrecy?

1.4.1 Sidgwick's Meta-Secrecy Doctrine

Let us ask ourselves first whether Sidgwick's covert utilitarianism would be unable to pass Kant's publicity test. As we have seen, this doctrine states that we should keep secret the very idea that some principles and actions should remain secret. This means that even at a very high level of generality, there is no way we could submit any maxim for assessment to the ideal public, unless such a maxim makes no direct reference to the problem of publicity. What about the following maxim however : “any means should be deemed appropriate if they serve the utilitarian ideal ”? Utilitarians will claim that an ideal public should at least consider utilitarianism a plausible doctrine. And it is therefore unlikely that the Kantian test will lead to a “necessary and unanimous” rejection of this proposed higher-order formulation of the maxim. Hence the test may be passed successfully, without any discussion on the issue of publicity. Of course, one may find such a maxim totally unjust for other reasons. But Kant himself does not seem to claim that his test should be seen as a sufficient test for justice anyway.

1.4.2 Glomar Responses

Our second example comes from actual Freedom of Information (FoI) regimes. That a public authority may have to minimally justify each of its significant decisions will seem totally sound. In principle, this should also hold each time a public authority denies access to a document requested by a citizen on the basis of his FoI right. The citizen should know whether it is e.g., on privacy, on trade secret or on State security grounds that access is being denied to the document he wants to double-check. There are cases however in which disclosing the exact reason why access to a document is denied would unavoidably entail the disclosure of the document's very content. One could deny access with no overt justification, implying that disclosing the precise ground for denial would be equivalent to disclosing the document's very content. Along the same lines, an authority could even refuse to deny or confirm the very existence of the requested document — which is known in US law as a Glomar response.[15]

Again, one may well propose a higher-order principle accounting for a Glomar type of response: “whenever access to a document may be denied on a legitimate basis and disclosing either the basis for denial or even the very existence of the document would jeopardize the pursuit of this very goal, a justification for denial or even the confirmation of the document's (non)-existence may be withheld”. So long as the set of such legitimate bases for denial is publicly discussed and (procedural) checks are being put in place to make sure that access is not denied on other grounds, there is no reason to believe that publicizing such a maxim will be self-frustrating in presence of a real public, nor that such a maxim should be rejected by an ideal public. Admittedly, the Glomar doctrine embodies some extent of “meta-secrecy”. However, it does not go as far as a meta-secrecy “à la Sidgwick”. For the very possibility that a State may sometimes act on secret grounds is not publicly denied, nor are the grounds for justifiable Glomar responses necessarily left outside the sphere of public discussion.[16]

1.4.3 The Judiciary's True Goal

Third example. Suppose that the true goal of the judiciary were to promote peace and stability rather than justice. However, let us assume as well that letting people believe that the genuine goal of such institutions is justice, would best guarantee peace, for decision acceptance would be enhanced accordingly if such decisions were perceived as just (Luban 1996, 160). In such a world, there is no question that peace would better be pursued by keeping it secret as the true goal of judiciary. The maxim may be: “act in a way such that if peace is best pursued by letting people think (wrongly) that it is in fact justice that is being pursued, you should let people think so”. Publicizing such a maxim may be “self-frustrating” and would therefore not pass the Kantian test.

However, besides asking ourselves whether such self-frustratingness is what accounts for the possibly unjust nature of the maxim, we may provide a higher order formulation of the maxim: “Act in a way such that if one legitimate goal is best pursued by letting people think (wrongly) that it is in fact another legitimate goal that is being pursued, you should let people think so”. This higher-order maxim's publication is not self-frustrating (even in a case in which we assume that the legitimacy of each goal has been examined in detail, along with the legitimacy of other goals). Of course, this does not end the discussion since in case we were to grant priority to justice over peace, the maxim's implementation could still lead to injustice, which the Kantian test does not exclude anyway.

1.4.4 The Optimal Confidentiality of FoI Laws

Let us finally move to an example that deals again with real Freedom of Information (FoI) regimes. One of the surprises of such regimes is that, as a matter of fact, their very existence remains rather confidential in many countries. Citizens do not seem to exercise their right of access to State-detained documents as much as one might expect. This could be regarded as unfortunate. One may as well consider it necessary, however, at least if we find meaningful the idea of an optimal level of confidentiality of FoI regimes. This optimal level would consist in some active citizens being maximally aware of its existence, and all civil servants being as little aware of it as possible. For if (non-ideal) civil servants know that they are potentially being watched, they may admittedly try to change their behavior for the better. However, they may simultaneously want to hide even further the more problematic aspects of their behavior (e.g. through shifting from written to oral discussions). In other words, in order for the fundamental FoI right to be maximally effective, its existence and exercise may have to remain relatively covert (or unequally known).

What should an ideal public think about the following maxim then: “In order for a legitimate goal to be pursued, while the goal itself would be fully public (here: the accountability of public authorities), while the social expectations of citizens towards civil servants would be fully transparent, some of the means enabling such citizens to ensure the accountability of public authorities may remain covert”? Not each and every such covert means is acceptable. However, the one consisting in a right to ask for a copy of administrative documents may very well be so. Of course, publicizing a lower order version of this maxim may be self-frustrating, hence incapable of passing the Kantian test. But again, this does not seem to be sufficient to discard this lower order maxim as being unjust, nor does it mean that a higher-order translation of it (as suggested above) would be unable to pass the Kantian test.

These four examples leave us with two important open questions on the Kantian test. First, how to assess the test's importance if the level of generality at which the maxim of an action should be phrased cannot be normatively fixed? As we have illustrated above, the lower the level of generality at which a maxim is phrased, the higher the risk that its publicity would be self-frustrating, and vice versa (Luban 1996, 189-191). No doubt, the test would be over-exclusive if we were forced to phrase our maxims at a very low level of generality. This is clear when we think about keeping secret the date of a currency devaluation or of a police intervention to trap criminals, the location of a stock of weapons in times of peace or of the place where an unjustly threatened writer is being sheltered. Kant himself never suggests that all secret actions should be ruled out by his test. The problem is that as long as we do not have any indication as to the appropriate level of generality at which an action's maxim should be tested, the opposite risk of under-exclusiveness becomes hard to avoid as our four examples above illustrate. Perhaps our expectations towards such a test are too high however, as they often tend to be towards other hypothetical devices as well, such as the Rawlsian veil of ignorance or hypothetical social contracts.

Second, it is not entirely clear why self-frustratingness (or purpose-frustratingness) should be read as an indicator of injustice. In other words, whenever the Kantian test bites, why would this tell us anything about the just or unjust nature of a maxim and the actions that fall under it?[17] And answering this question would be even more crucial for those who — contrary to us — view the publicity test as a necessary and sufficient condition for permissibility. What we need then is an account of the “intrinsic connection” between self-frustratingness and injustice — in the same way as one may ask why, for (neo-) contractarians there should be a significant connection between (hypothetical) insurance and justice. Such an account is however not provided by Kant who claims about the principle that “like an axiom, it is indemonstrably certain” (1795: 382). One sound suggestion is Luban's (Luban 1996, 191). Imagine that making the maxim of my action public would frustrate my ability to reach this maxim's very goal. This can only be taken as a sign of the injustice of this maxim if the frustration-generating mechanism is at least in part based itself on morally justifiable grounds. But if publicizing a doctrine generates distrust from a real audience merely because of people's attraction for simplicity or non-demandingness, the frustration flowing from such a distrust should hardly be considered relevant to the assessment of the maxim's (in)justice.

2. Actual Publicity

Actual publicity can be looked at through the prism of hypothetical publicity. However, philosophers have been approaching the issue from other angles as well. Their arguments have mobilized both empirical assumptions and philosophical claims regarding the purpose of voting and political representation, the importance of participation and deliberation, etc. Hereinafter, we will examine more closely arguments in favor or against actual publicity in the political arena. In order to do so, we will restrict ourselves to two modes of political action (vote and deliberation) and two types of actors (electors and representatives). In so doing, we will consider two types of relationships: horizontal ones (among voters or among representatives) and vertical ones (between voters and representatives). Notice already that the view one favors regarding the function attached to one's vote as a member of the electorate and to one's activity as a representative will have an impact on the reasons why publicity may matter and the extent to which it does.

Before engaging in this philosophical discussion, let us clarify what the arguments developed below may show for one significant practical evolution, i.e., the development of Freedom of Information (FoI) regimes in democratic countries during the second half of the 20th century.[18] Such regimes have been set up with the view of allowing citizens to participate more actively in public affairs, enabling them to have access to the detail of most administrative documents in due time.[19] Hence, not only MPs but civil servants become more effectively accountable. This means that citizens are not forced to simply accept package deals from their representatives at the time of elections. They can go and question the practicalities of implementation at any time.

Not only does the enactment of FoI regimes provide opportunities for multiple interactions between active citizens and state authorities. They also force us to weigh the relative importance of open government vis a vis other fundamental rights or the public interest in general. Specific grounds for denying access to administrative documents include the protection of privacy, property rights (e.g., trade secrets), secrecy easing the gathering of information from third parties (e.g. executive privilege[20] or medical secrecy), paternalistic justifications (e.g., in the case of technical documents that could be misinterpreted), state interests (e.g., in defense and terrorism matters or international negotiations), economic efficiency (e.g., in public procurement, the content of the offer made by competitors being only disclosed after the final decision). Sometimes, such grounds for secrecy will justify strict denial of access. On other occasions, the disclosure of information will simply be deferred (e.g., through declassification procedures) or selective (e.g., to some types of actors only). This variety of potential justifications of secrecy and the diverse ways of accommodating the conflicting values constitute a largely unexplored terrain for applied political philosophy. Here, we will only focus on general reasons to promote or restrict actual publicity.

2.1 Voting

2.1.1 Mill's (1861) Case Against Secret Ballot

Let us look at voting first. We may begin with the view according to which the electoral process only aims at aggregating people's individual preferences regarding the type of decisions they consider in their own interest (rather than in the public interest). Under such a view, there is no strong case for making sure that my fellow citizen be able to know what my actual preferences are. This is especially significant when it comes to direct democracy (e.g., referendum). However, in cases involving representation, there may still be good reasons under this view of democracy, for representatives to know which type of electors exactly they are representing, hence for open ballots. In other words, even under an “aggregation of private interests” view of democracy, there may be a case for open ballots. This case will have nothing to do with the need for fellow voters to know about their neighbor's actual preferences, though. Only their representatives need to know about them.

Let us now move to a different conception of democracy, the one advocated for example by John Stuart Mill:

In any political election, even by universal suffrage (and still more obviously in the case of a restricted suffrage), the voter is under an absolute moral obligation to consider the interest of the public, not his private advantage, and give his vote, to the best of his judgment, exactly as he would be bound to do if he were the sole voter, and the election depended upon him alone. This being admitted, it is at least a prima facie consequence that the duty of voting, like any other public duty, should be performed under the eye and criticism of the public; every one of whom has not only an interest in its performance, but a good title to consider himself wronged if it is performed otherwise than honestly and carefully. Undoubtedly neither this nor any other maxim of political morality is absolutely inviolable; it may be overruled by still more cogent considerations. But its weight is such that the cases which admit of a departure from it must be of a strikingly exceptional character (Mill 1861, 355).

J. S. Mill later discusses whether such reasons to depart from publicity do hold — an issue to which we shall return. What matters here however is that once we consider that voters are supposed to vote according to what they believe would promote the public interest, rather than their own private interests,[22] the case for publicity is reversed. On the one hand, if we can associate to such a conception of voting one of representation according to which representatives are supposed to defend the public interest rather than the class interests of their identifiable electors,[23] the case for vertical publicity weakens. For knowing who their electors actually are may induce MPs to stick to a defense of their actual electors rather than to promote the public interest at large. On the other hand, the very act of taking part in an election acquires a non-private dimension, such that we should consider ourselves accountable towards our fellow citizens (horizontal accountability). And this view according to which we should regard ourselves as horizontally accountable towards those who may be affected by the consequences of our choices clearly supports the case against secret ballots. For J. S. Mill, this is a very significant reason for open ballots. In fact, he even stresses that, as electors, we should see ourselves accountable not only towards fellow electors, but also to non-electors whenever the franchise is not as universal as it could be (which generates the risk of electors voting only to defend their class interests as voters).[24] The example from Mill's times is the one of women, who were excluded from “manhood suffrage”. Present day illustrations could refer to non-national residents excluded from the right to vote or to those below the age of majority.[25]

2.1.2 Why Worry About Open Vote?

John Stuart Mill was not the first to write about vote secrecy. Authors such as Cicero (De Legibus III, 15), Montesquieu,[26] Rousseau[27] and Tocqueville[28] had also expressed their views on the matter. And J. S. Mill's intervention is in fact part of a lively debate that had been going on in England for several decades.[29] He writes:

It may, unquestionably, be the fact that if we attempt, by publicity, to make the voter responsible to the public for his vote, he will practically be made responsible for it to some powerful individual, whose interest is more opposed to the general interest of the community than that of the voter himself would be if, by the shield of secrecy, he were released from responsibility altogether. When this is the condition, in a high degree, of a large proportion of the voters, the ballot may be the smaller evil. When the voters are slaves, anything may be tolerated which enables them to throw off the yoke. The strongest case for the ballot is when the mischievous power of the Few over the Many is increasing […].

But in the more advanced states of modern Europe, and especially in this country, the power of coercing voters has declined and is declining; and bad voting is now less to be apprehended from the influences to which the voter is subject at the hands of others than from the sinister interests and discreditable feelings which belong to himself, either individually or as a member of a class. To secure him against the first, at the cost of removing all restraint from the last, would be to exchange a smaller and a diminishing evil for a greater and increasing one […][30]

Brennan & Pettit (1990) recently revived J. S. Mill's argument, endorsing the view that while we should not assume that people will generally tend to vote according to their private interest whenever voting is secret, unveiling the vote would certainly encourage further the practice of voting in accordance with what one considers to be the common good (Brennan & Pettit 1990, 325-329). They argue as well that the case for open vote is especially strong in pluralistic societies involving large electorates.[31]

Still, J. S. Mill's lesser evil type of justification for open votes has been rejected in the past on at least three grounds. First, one could question the very purpose that J. S. Mill ascribes to voting. Hence, some of the protagonists of the 19th century British debate criticized the view according to which voting should be regarded as a trust rather than a right.[32] This entails, in contrast with John S. Mill's view, that ballot secrecy is not even a lesser evil. It is no evil at all. Second, one may disagree with Mill the Son at the factual level rather than at the normative one. James Mill, his father, clearly agreed with his son on the purpose of voting, referring explicitly on various occasions to the idea of a trust. In his long essay “On the Ballot”, he states that “The voter for a member of Parliament has a trust placed in his hands, on the discharge of which the highest interests of his country depend”.[33] However, James Mill considered — in opposition to his son's view — that the negative consequences attached to the secret ballot were not only less weighty than its advantages, but devoid of any weight at all.[34] This entails that for James Mill as well, introducing secrecy of vote was not even a lesser evil reform. It did not involve any evil at all. Third , let us consider Bentham's position. Although he does not refer explicitly to the trust-based view of voting, he considers that voters should be influenced by tutelary motives. For him, “in judging whether a motive ought to be referred to the class of seductive or tutelary motives, it is necessary to examine whether, in the case in question, it tends […] to favour the greatest or the smallest number”.[35] After balancing the pros and cons of publicity, Bentham concludes: “The system of secresy has therefore a useful tendency in those circumstances in which publicity exposes the voter to the influence of a particular interest opposed to the public interest. Secresy is therefore in general suitable in elections”. In contrast with James Mill, Bentham's argument is of the lesser-evil type. But contrary to J. S. Mill, it is a lesser-evil argument in favor of secrecy rather than publicity.[36]

Such developments may be dismissed as being of merely historical interest. And indeed, except for Brennan & Pettit's (1990) paper, there is not much debate today anymore about the suitability of secret ballot. Rather, the whole debate on secrecy seems to have shifted its focus to parliamentary debate, and more recently to administrative activity (FoI). Still, there are at least three lessons to be learnt from the old “secret ballot” debate, over and above the fact that vote secrecy should not be seen as entailing no costs at all. First, already at that time, there were attempts at envisaging simultaneously the questions of vote secrecy in the case of electors and in the case of representatives.[37] And the interesting fact is that we do not have today a clear theory telling us why we should have secret ballots for electors and open votes in plenary parliamentary sessions. Simply referring to the fact that representatives are accountable to their electors (vertical accountability) in a sense in which electors are not to their fellow citizens (horizontal accountability) seems insufficient in that respect. Ceteris paribus, the importance of horizontal accountability, insofar as it emphasizes the need to minimally justify our decisions to those who may suffer from their consequences, could suffice to justify openness. Moreover, it is probably also insufficient to claim that the fact that representatives may lose their job as a result of electoral discontent is not as problematic as the fact that electors could lose their job if their employer were to know about who they voted for. This does not mean that differences are absent. Ceteris paribus, a representative has more power for example than a citizen.[38] What we need to ask ourselves is whether this is sufficient to justify a different of treatment between the two categories with regard to vote publicity.

Second, open vote in parliament may not only give room to pressure from your actual electors. It may also lead to pressure from those who did not actually vote for you or from well-organized lobbies defending some specific interests. This is probably one of the concerns today in many countries. Publicity allows the electors to use the stick/threat of non-reelection in full knowledge of what a representative actually did. Still, it allows as well other actors to do so, who may neither be the representative's actual electors, nor lobbies acting in the name of the general interest. The employers and landowners may not pressure employees and landless people anymore. Still, lobbyists representing the former may still be pressuring the MPs elected by the latter, with comparable results. This indicates how pressure made possible through publicity may force representatives to take directions that do not fit with the view of the public interest defended by those who elected them. Pressure is a double-edged sword. This may call at least for mixed systems, to which we shall come back shortly. Perhaps this may even justify taking more seriously the possibility of vote anonymity in parliament, provided that the number of votes for and against each proposal be known anyway.

Finally, one may consider that the only way of dealing with such issue will consist in obtaining empirical evidence on the respective effects of secrecy and publicity and weighing them up[39]. More principled arguments could be developed however. Such principled arguments could take at least two (non-exclusive) forms. According to one strategy, even in a society where the level of coercion on voters is very weak on average, it is reasonable to assume that those who will suffer most from such risk of coercion (given their higher dependence on others) are the least advantaged. There may thus be a maximin case for secret ballots on such grounds, putting priority on the protection of the most vulnerable. The other strategy would consist in stressing the fact that the extent to which intimidation and coercion on voters obtains in a given society may fluctuate, hence evolve at some point for the worse, in line with political or economic degradations, including good results of intimidating extreme right or left parties or a higher vulnerability due to growing unemployment rates. A preventive approach would thus consist in saying that once coercion would increase to an extent such that it would become worrying (provided that there are levels of coercion that would not be worrying in the first place), it would then be too late to switch back to secret vote. This could justify preserving vote secrecy all along (and possibly banning e.g., voting via mail or the internet insofar as they do not guarantee secrecy strictly enough), even when the risk of coercion or intimidation is currently negligible.[40]

2.2 Deliberation

2.2.1 Can Publicity Civilize Representatives?

Let us now turn to the issue of public deliberation. Notice first that the arguments for open ballots invoked above in the context of an “aggregation of private interests” view of voting, equally hold to justify the publicity of debates taking place between representatives. This may have to do with the mere need to “learn about each other”. In other words, in a system in which vertical accountability matters, it is essential both for citizens to know exactly what their representatives think and do, and for representatives to know more than once every four years how the electorate reacts to their arguments and decisions.

Learning about each other is one thing. Learning from each other (about facts, what to think or how to act) is another, however.[41] Publicity is not only supposed to allow for citizens and their representatives to act upon fixed preferences regarding their private or even the public interests. The interactions that publicity allows for are also potentially rich in transformative power. Such a dynamic impact can take various forms. Publicity of deliberations between representatives may play an exemplary role for citizens (both procedurally and substantively), as suggested for instance by Jeremy Bentham, who writes that “the order which reigns in the discussion of a political assembly, will form by imitation the national spirit. This order will be reproduced in clubs and inferior assemblies, in which the people will be pleased to find the regularity of which they have formed the idea from the greater model”.[42] Similarly, we have seen that open ballots can force electors to restrict themselves in public to positions that they would be able to justify to other fellow citizens. And this is true even when their fellow citizens are not especially educated, as J. S. Mill argued:

The notion is itself unfounded, that publicity, and the sense of being answerable to the public, are of no use unless the public are qualified to form a sound judgment. It is a very superficial view of the utility of public opinion to suppose that it does good only when it succeeds in enforcing a servile conformity to itself. To be under the eyes of others — to have to defend oneself to others — is never more important than to those who act in opposition to the opinion of others, for it obliges them to have sure ground of their own. Nothing has so steadying an influence as working against pressure. Unless when under the temporary sway of passionate excitement, no one will do that which he expects to be greatly blamed for, unless from a preconceived and fixed purpose of his own; which is always evidence of a thoughtful and deliberate character, and, except in radically bad men, generally proceeds from sincere and strong personal convictions. Even the bare fact of having to give an account of their conduct is a powerful inducement to adhere to conduct of which at least some decent account can be given. If any one thinks that the mere obligation of preserving decency is not a very considerable check on the abuse of power, he has never had his attention called to the conduct of those who do not feel under the necessity of observing that restraint. Publicity is inappreciable, even when it does no more than prevent that which can by no possibility be plausibly defended — than compel deliberation, and force every one to determine, before he acts, what he shall say if called to account for his actions.[43]

Now, representatives can civilize their electorate through public deliberation, as suggested by Bentham. And voters may well be civilized by their not-necessarily-civilized fellow voters (and non-voters) in case of open ballots, as J.S. Mill argued. Jon Elster presented still another view according to which the publicity of deliberation would help citizens civilizing their representatives. Hereinafter, we briefly elaborate on what Elster refers to as “the civilizing force of hypocrisy”. The central passage is the following:

Generally speaking, the effect of an audience is to replace the language of interest by the language of reason and to replace impartial motives by passionate ones. The presence of a public makes it especially hard to appear motivated merely by self-interest. Even if one's fellow assembly members would not be shocked, the audience would be. In general, this civilizing force of hypocrisy is a desirable effect of publicity. […] Publicity does not eliminate base motives, but forces and induces speakers to hide them (Elster 1998, 111; Naurin 2003).

The Filter

Elster's idea can be presented in two steps. The first one is the filtering step. The public is meant to hold normative expectations regarding what representatives are supposed to say.[44] One of these expectations is that any overt reference to mere self-interest in the course of justifying their position would be seen as unacceptable[45] — which leaves open the question whether a reference to the self-interest of their class of electors would.[46] Another expectation could be that representatives justify their position through a reference to minimally general principles. Finally, there would also be a social norm favoring arguing over bargaining,[47] such that whenever the debate would have to take place in public, deliberation oriented towards the force of the better argument would be promoted. This will entail at the very least the need to disguise overt threats as warnings (Elster 1998, 103-104). We may multiply the number of such expectations. Such normative expectations regarding acceptable discourse will act as a filter on what the representatives are allowed to say. Notice that it is not hypocrisy as such that filters out the set of unacceptable speech elements. However, it allows the representative to engage into a discourse in which he does not necessarily believe. In other words, this account does not necessarily presuppose a normative expectation among the public that politicians ought to be sincere.[48] Actually, hypocrisy is rather an enabling factor (allowing for an initial gap between what is said and thought) than a cleaning up factor.

Does the argument presuppose that voters be on average more civilized than their representatives? At least two types of answers can be provided. First, there are reasons of principle to doubt that representatives be on average wiser (or more committed to the common good) than their electorate. As Luban writes,

… the empirical validity of the publicity principle turns not on whether the Many are ignorant or wrong-headed, but on whether their leaders are less ignorant or less wrong-headed. No doubt the Wise are few; and the leaders are few; but it hardly follows that the leaders are wise. Before we reject the publicity principle because the leaders know best, we must have reason to believe that the leaders know better. And to find that out, we must look carefully at the variety of mechanisms by which decision-making elites are actually selected. If actual selection mechanisms choose randomly between the Many and the Wise, or affirmatively disfavor the Wise, then the foolishness of the many is irrelevant: the Few in official positions have no reason to suppose that their policy brainstorms are any less foolish (Luban 1996, 193).

Second, the average level of civilization may be less relevant than the presence of at least a minority of civilized members. As J. S. Mill puts it, “[…] cases exist […] in which almost the only restraint upon a majority of knaves consists in their involuntary respect for the opinion of an honest minority” (Mill 1861, 362). In line with this Millian view, were the average level of civilization among representatives higher or equivalent to the one obtaining within the electorate, publicity could still increase in absolute terms the amount of civilized persons attending the representative's discourse, adding civilized members of the public to those who are civilized in parliament. Hence, through such a sampling effect, if we agree with Mill that the mere presence of a civilized minority can make some difference, a larger absolute size of such a minority might be relevant. As for Elster, he explicitly relies more directly on a multiplier effect, insisting that “a small group of impartially minded individuals might induce many others to mimic their impartiality out of self-interest” (Elster 1995, 249). And as Elster points out, this is even more true whenever there is uncertainty as to who these impartially minded people are (Elster 1995, 248).

Reducing cognitive dissonance

Now, here comes a second step in Elster's argument (Elster 1986, § II). There is an additional normative expectation: once representatives commit themselves in public to a given view, they are not supposed to switch to another view unless they can justify such a departure (Elster 1998, 104).As Elster puts it, “public speaking is subject to a consistency constraint. Once a speaker has adopted an impartial argument because it corresponds to his interest or prejudice, he will be seen as opportunistic if he deviates from it when it ceases to serve his needs”.[49] Citizens may be more or less vigilant regarding compliance with such a “consistency through time” requirement. Still, it is likely to have some weight.

Furthermore, as representatives cannot publicly depart from the principled views they have expressed earlier, they may begin believing in what they say, even though they may not have been holding such views at the time they began expressing them.[50] Hence, being forced to restrict oneself to publicly acceptable views may turn out influencing what one eventually believes, insofar as in order to reduce the dissonance between what one says and what one believes, one may come to genuinely believe what one is expected to say. Civilizing people's speech will eventually civilize their mind (and hopefully in turn their non-linguistic actions) and — so Elster claims — “on the average, […] yield more equitable outcomes” (Elster 1995, 251). What begins as a strategic use of a non-self-interested arguments ends up leading to preference change (Fearon 1998, 54).

Notice that Goodin has proposed an alternative account to the cognitive dissonance reduction one. For him, people do have a latent moral sense and having to state arguments in public acts as a reminder of what they already agree with. They may not necessarily have connected the issue at stake with the principles they do endorse otherwise.[51] One possible way of contrasting Goodin's alternative with the cognitive dissonance view is the following. What is at stake would be as much a matter of reducing dissonance between what one says and what one genuinely believes, as one of reducing dissonance between two separate beliefs one holds.

Having offered an account of Elster's idea of the civilizing force of hypocrisy, there are at least two empirical questions to be asked. First, are Elster's factual assumptions empirically plausible? Second, are there no other negative side effects related with publicity that could outweigh the benefits identified by Elster? In the next section, we provide elements that may be relevant to answering the latter question. Let us briefly address the first challenge here. Naurin (2004) provides interesting evidence in this respect. On the one hand, he refers to a study by Joerges & Neyer (1997) that looked closely at European Union comitology committees. Their study indicates that public-spirited deliberation can be present in such committees whose existence is unknown to most people. This may seem reassuring as it could suggest that publicity is not necessary to foster truly deliberative behavior. However, on the other hand, Naurin refers to evidence from Eliasoph (1998: 7) suggesting in the case of activists that while in backroom conversations they tend to express themselves with reference to justice and common good concerns, shifting to a front stage context also increases their use of self-regarding arguments. Naurin's (2004) own empirical data illustrate a similar trend in the case of industry lobbyists in the European Union context. In other words, a forum-like type of behavior would already be present in the lobby corridor. Surprisingly enough, bringing lobbyists from the backstage to the front stage would actually make things worse from the point of view of reducing reference to mere self-interest. One should admittedly be cautious in extrapolating such results.[52] Still, both Eliasoph and Naurin identify a phenomenon that actually goes in the opposite direction of what Elster's view implies. This is clearly a serious challenge to his theory.

2.2.2 The Quality of Deliberation

The variety of effects of publicity on the nature of the deliberation process is clearly an understudied matter. We have already looked at some impacts, asking ourselves whether publicity substitutes public-interest-oriented to self-regarding arguments, and whether it leads to a shift from bargaining to deliberation. Here, leaving Elster's account aside for a moment, we go on with examining other dimensions of what can be referred to — in an admittedly vague manner — as the quality of the debate. For one central problem with publicity is that besides being possibly beneficial in some respects, it may also modify the nature of the discussion in ways that are not desirable. One such negative side-effects, as identified by James Madison in 1787 in the case of the American Constitutional Convention, is the following:

Had the members committed themselves publicly at first, they would have afterwards supposed consistency required them to maintain their ground, whereas by secret discussion no man felt himself obliged to retain his opinions any longer than he was satisfied of their propriety and truth, and was open to the force of argument.[53]

The idea of sticking to a position and not being ready to depart from it despite the existence of good arguments can be a problem for at least two reasons.[54] Consensus will be harder to reach because of it, which matters whenever agreement can only be reached by consensus (be it in a deliberation or in a bargaining type of context). More importantly, we may be worried not so much about the lack of sincerity of the actors, but certainly about the loss in debate spontaneity.[55] Unless the deliberating parties are able to try out ideas out of the blue with the risk of having to abandon them straightaway (trial and error), to show hesitation,[56] to re-consider the issues again and again with a fresh eye, the actual deliberation may not be more than the juxtaposition of pre-prepared statements with no actual interaction taking place.[57] For the public may view hesitation and trial and error as signs of a lack of commitment, which may disadvantage those representatives truly taking part in the discussion, hence inhibiting them from adopting a genuinely deliberative posture. And as Naurin puts it, “[…] if deliberation is about transforming preferences, and publicity forces you to know what you want and stand by your position, then “public deliberation” is something of a contradiction in terms” (Naurin 2003, 32). we value deliberation as a true living interaction with real transformative power, there might then be a strong case for at least some proportion of political deliberation taking place behind closed-doors, despite the latter's negative side-effects.[58]

Meade & Stasavage (see Other Internet Resources) documented another way in which publicity might negatively affect the quality of deliberation. They deal with the specific case of central banks and whether minutes of board meetings should be released. Based on empirical evidence, they show how, under conditions of publicity, the fact that expert advisors may have career concerns reduces the chances of dissent being expressed during deliberation. Here, what is at stake is not whether one sticks to one's own initial position (posture problem). Rather, it has to do with whether one is ready to show disagreement with the position taken by another expert who is highly regarded and has spoken first (dissent problem).[59] Hence, publicity might generate disincentives both to openly changing one's mind and, in some contexts, to dissenting with other (authoritative) people's views.

In another recent paper, Chambers (2004) points at still another negative impact of publicity on the quality of deliberation. Discussion behind closed doors will admittedly tend to allow for the expression of particularistic (which does not necessarily mean “self-serving”) reasons that would not pass the test of actual publicity. However, while making deliberation public might force the deliberating parties both to provide the best possible reasons in support of their claims (Socratic effect) and to provide public reasons (democratic effect) in the sense of reasons that should refer to the public interest and be acceptable to a wide audience in a pluralistic society, one problem remains.[60] For publicity also tends as a matter of fact to favor reasons that are “plebiscitory” in the sense of shallow or manipulative (Chambers 2004, 393). Moving from private, particularistic reasons to truly public reasons may then often have an associated price, i.e., shifting from profound (private) reasons to shallow (public) reasons. Admittedly, the reason why they are shallow might have to do with the need for a common denominator (which could be needed as well in a deliberation behind closed doors). However, it is plausible that it may also have to do with an attempt at pleasing the public (populism).

These are just a few illustrations of possible negative side effects of bringing deliberation under the public eye. It may become less lively (in the sense of being a real interaction), leave room to less dissent in the presence of an authoritative member, and favor the more shallow types of arguments, no matter how rational and public they are. It matters to identify exactly which benefits and which negative side effects are attached to actual publicity and secrecy, and what their respective weight could be. It is true in this respect that the argument may be of a different nature or at least carry a different weight depending on whether one deals with voting or deliberation. For instance, the importance of learning from each other (rather than simply about each other) may provide a strong argument for public deliberation without necessarily being sufficient to entail the need for open ballots.

Once all normative and empirical dimensions have been carefully considered, one may want to adopt a firm standpoint regarding the need for publicity or secrecy in deliberation and voting in general. However, we may also want to try to mix secrecy and publicity in ways that allow for more optimal schemes, providing us with the best of both worlds. Let us illustrate this through pointing at two of such schemes. First, Bentham refers to a system obtaining in the Polish Permanent Council in the late 18th century by which an open vote was followed by a secret vote on the very same issue (Bentham 1843, 147-148). Second, Elster argues that a constitution-making process “ought to contain elements of both secrecy (committee discussion) and publicity (plenary assembly discussions). With total secrecy, partisan interests and logrolling come to the forefront, whereas full publicity encourages grandstanding and rhetorical overbidding. Conversely, secrecy allows for serious discussion, whereas publicity ensures that any deals struck are capable of withstanding the light of day” (Elster 1998, 117). One can thus mix both publicity and secrecy in the case of voting (Bentham) or deliberation (Elster), through a succession of openness and secrecy (Bentham)[61] or secrecy and openness (Elster).[62] One could also envisage to mix public deliberation and secret vote (which is probably a correct description of what happens during electoral periods in many democratic countries), or, conversely, secret deliberation and public vote (which is what actually takes place in parliamentary systems with secret commissions in which plenary debates take a purely formal dimension). Each of such mixes may have specific properties that could be studied further.

3. Rawls on Public Rules and Public Reason

We have looked at issues of hypothetical publicity and actual publicity. In this third and last section, we briefly introduce the reader to Rawls's views on publicity.[63] This aims at illustrating the fact that the word “public” can be used in various ways, the connection between each of these meanings still having to be fully investigated. In fact, Rawls essentially relies on two central concepts of publicity: “public rule” and “public reason”. Let us look at each of them in turn.

3.1 Public Rules

Let us first look at the idea of public rules. Rawls discusses this in the context of defining the scope of his principles of social justice. They apply to the so-called “basic structure of society”, i.e., the “arrangement of major social institutions”. It is in the course of defining what an institution is that Rawls writes:

In saying that an institution, and therefore the basic structure of society, is a public system of rules, I mean then that everyone engaged in it knows what he would know if these rules and his participation in the activity they define were the result of an agreement. A person taking part in an institution knows what the rules demand of him and of the others. He also knows that the other know this and that they know that he knows this, and so on […]. The principles of justice are to apply to social arrangements understood to be public in this sense. Where the rules of a certain subpart of an institution are known only to those belonging to it, we may assume that there is an understanding that those in this part can make rules for themselves as long as these rules are designed to achieve ends generally accepted and others are not adversely affected. The publicity of the rules of an institution insures that those engaged in it know what limitations on conduct to expect of one another and what kinds of actions are permissible. There is a common basis for determining mutual expectations.[64]

What does this mean? First, Rawls uses a rather demanding hypothetical test. He says that even if the system of rules does not actually result from an agreement, it will legitimately be referred to as public as long as our knowledge about such rules is the same as the one we would have if we had effectively been involved in the actual process of agreeing with such rules.[65] Second, the idea of publicity goes beyond mere general knowledge (i.e., each of us knows the rules). It also extends to mutual knowledge (each of us “knows that the others know”). Third, the rationale invoked to justify such a publicity requirement is that people need to know what is permissible and what is not. It would be unjust to blame or sanction someone for an action that she would not be in a position to expect to be in violation of an existing rule. In addition to this (vertical) justice requirement, there is probably as well a reference to the benefits from social coordination. This is what may explain why Rawls insists not only on general knowledge, but also on mutual knowledge. In this sense, public is used here both in the sense of “knowable” and “shared”.

Let us mention two more types of considerations. On the one hand, there are further developments on this matter in Political Liberalism (II, §4). To the developments above — corresponding with what he refers to in Political Liberalism as the first level of publicity — Rawls adds the fact that the principles of justice should not only be known, but also accepted (and known to be accepted) (Rawls 1993, 66). Moreover, there are two extra levels of publicity, having to do with the public nature of the justification of the public conception of justice. The second level of publicity indeed applies to “the general beliefs in the light of which first principles of justice themselves can be accepted, that is, the general beliefs about human nature and the way political and social institutions generally work, and indeed all such beliefs relevant to political justice”.[66] As to the third level, it requires that beyond the rather factual knowledge referred to at the second level, the full justification of the so-called “public conception of justice” be available. More precisely, “this justification includes everything that we would say — you and I — when we set up justice as fairness and reflect why we proceed in one way rather than another. At this level I suppose this full justification also to be publicly known, or better, at least to be publicly available” (Rawls 1993, 67).

On the other hand, in a paper devoted to the problem of incentives, Williams argues that in A Theory of Justice,

[…] Rawls appears to regard institutions' constitutive rules as public in three respects. Thus, individuals are able to attain common knowledge of the rules' (i) general applicability, (ii) their particular requirements, and (iii) the extent to which individuals conform with those requirements. Given such conditions, it is clear that not all norms qualify as public [and thus institutional][67] in Rawls's sense. For example, self-effacing moral principles, the success of which depends on some being ignorant of their applicability, are clearly disqualified. So too are those norms which are so informationally demanding that individuals are incapable of mutually verifying the status of their conduct.[68]

Williams' latter example illustrates a distinct use of the concept of publicity. The idea is that rules relying on features that are insufficiently verifiable may not qualify as public rules. This is arguably the case with the idea of compensating for special labor burdens, which leads Williams to conclude that “the ideal of occupational compensation cannot be institutionalized” (Williams 1998, 239) and that

If […] such conceptions should facilitate well-ordered social cooperation, we have reason to reject conceptions of justice which, given the fact of limited information, are too epistemically demanding to be public and stable. We should, like Rawls, favor conceptions whose scope is restricted to publicly accessible phenomena (Williams 1998, 245).

It is beyond the scope of this entry to discuss Williams' argument in detail.[69] The slogan that “justice must be seen in order to be done”[70] which he mentions, clearly goes further than simply requiring that rules themselves be public. It stresses the importance of ensuring that the degree of actual compliance with such rules be itself public. This is related with matters of trust in the State's actual commitment to ensure compliance as well as with concerns for compliance among fellow citizens,[71] both being seen as legitimately affecting our willingness to cooperate. Justifications for the publicity requirement mentioned above do not suffice to provide grounds to establish the need to guarantee the mutual assurance among citizens that such public rules are effectively complied with, and known to be so.[72] This just gives an idea of how wide the scope of the publicity requirement may be in Rawls's own work and how diverse its justifications are. In this case, what seems to play a key role is that citizens would be entitled to condition their own compliance with public rules to the fact that other citizens would equally comply with them.[73]

3.2 Public Reason

The other significant use Rawls makes of the idea of publicity is through his notion of public reason. In this case, we are not dealing anymore with whether voting or deliberation should be public or not. Nor are we asking why rules should be public. Instead, we are asking ourselves how we should deliberate in public, which types of reasons we are entitled to refer to in the course of defending our standpoint to others.

Rawls discusses this extensively in the sixth lecture of Political Liberalism as well as in “The idea of public reason revisited”. The core idea is present in what he refers to as the criterion of reciprocity and the duty of civility. As to the former, Rawls writes:

[…] the idea of political legitimacy based on the criterion of reciprocity says: our exercise of political power is proper only when we sincerely believe that the reasons we would offer for our political actions — were we to state them as government officials — are sufficient, and we also reasonably think that other citizens might also reasonably accept those reasons (Rawls 1999a, 137).

Similarly, he writes about the ideal of public reason that it is realized in domestic society:

whenever judges, legislators, chief executives, and other government officials, as well as candidates for public office, act from and follow the idea of public reason and explain to other citizens their reasons to support fundamental political questions in terms of the political conception of justice that they regard as the most reasonable. In this way, they fulfill […] their duty of civility to one another and to other citizens. […] [I]deally, citizens are to think of themselves as if they were legislators and ask themselves what statutes, supported by what reasons satisfying the criterion of reciprocity, they would think is most reasonable to enact (Rawls 1999a, 55-56).

For example, in dealing with issues such as whether abortion or the excision of young girls should be allowed, citizens abiding by the idea of public reason are only entitled to justify the position they want to adopt on those matters on the basis of reasons that could reasonably be accepted by other citizens who do not necessarily share the same metaphysical, religious or cultural views.

There are of course risks attached to such a constraint. For one may then in some cases be led not to articulate the true reasons why one would oppose or promote a given standpoint. There are two ways of addressing this worry. First, we can indicate ways in which the constraint of public reason does not apply to each and every moment of our social life. Its scope is supposed to be restricted to discussions on constitutional essentials and matters of basic justice, which would exclude e.g., “much tax legislation, and many laws regulating property, statutes protecting the environment and controlling pollution; […]” (Rawls 1993, 214; Rawls 1993, Lecture VI, § 5). It also applies only to deliberation taking place within the so-called “public forum”, which excludes “our personal deliberations and reflections about political questions, or the reasoning about them by members of associations such as churches or universities […]” (Rawls 1993, 215). And one can finally replace an “exclusive” with and “inclusive” form of public reason. The latter consists in “allowing citizens, in certain situations, to present what they regard as the basis of political values rooted in their comprehensive doctrine, provided they do this in ways that strengthen the ideal of public reason itself” (Rawls 1993, 247). This leads Rawls to consider e.g., that 19th century abolitionists and 20th century civil rights activists combating slavery on religious grounds were in line with the ideal of public reason (Rawls 1993, 251).

Second, for those still concerned with shallowness and insincerity due to the public reason constraint, Rawls would insist that we should stick to such a constraint:

… given our duty of civility to other citizens. After all, they share with us the same sense of its imperfection, though on different grounds, as they hold different comprehensive doctrines and believe different grounds are left out of account. But it is the only way, and by accepting that politics in a democratic society can never be guided by what we see as the whole truth, that we can realize the ideal expressed by the principle of legitimacy: to live politically with others in the light of reasons all might reasonably be expected to endorse (Rawls 1999a, 242-243).

There is a substantial amount of literature discussing Rawls's account of public reason.[74] And it is certainly beyond the scope of this entry to look at the possible alternatives to Rawls's way of dealing with the consequences of “the fact of reasonable pluralism”. Suffice it to say here that the adjective “public” as it is used here refers more to “shared” or “social” (as in “public life”) than to “transparent” (as in “public pleadings”). The idea of “public rules” as used by Rawls is more ambiguous and refers to the opposite of both “secret” and “private”. The possibly deep and numerous connections between these meanings of publicity remain yet to be explored more carefully.

4. Conclusion

We began our exploration by looking at Kant's hypothetical publicity test. We asked ourselves whether there were good reasons to believe that hypothetical publicity should be considered a sound requirement to test maxims of action. We also wondered whether hypothetical publicity entailed significant restrictions from the point of view of actual publicity. The answer appears to be rather negative in both cases. For, first, there does not seem to be any intrinsic relationship between self-frustratingness and justice. To put things in another way, the less the effect of publicity is contingent, the more we can doubt about its validity as a test of justice. And second, if no criterion is provided as to the level of generality at which the Kantian test should operate, we run both risks of under and over-exclusiveness. Which maxims of action should be deemed unjust is therefore left rather undefined by the test in most cases.

While it is unclear whether the Kantian hypothetical publicity test could (and should) be rescued, there is no doubt that actual publicity issues raise very interesting philosophical challenges. One of them has to do with the articulation between, on the one hand, the function that political philosophy ascribes to voting, representation and deliberation, and, on the other hand, the types of effects that could be expected from going public. In the course of our discussion, we also tried to draw parallels and to identify differences between voters and their representatives (e.g., through the idea of horizontal accountability) and between the voting and the deliberation debate. The meaning of the publicity requirement may differ significantly as well when we compare standard representative bodies (e.g. parliaments) with the civil service or with “independent” bodies acting within a democratic context (e.g., central banks or courts). Publicity in the latter case is likely to have both a meaning and consequences quite different from the ones attached to public deliberation e.g., in a parliament's plenary session.

Moreover, while we certainly did not question the possibility of developing principled views in the field of actual publicity, factual assumptions present in most of the key arguments in this respect (e.g., in those of J.S. Mill or Elster) require more extensive empirical research. The results that we reported from some of these empirical investigations are potentially rich in consequences for our normative theories. The data gathered by Naurin (2004) and Meade & Stasavage (2004) are especially important in this respect. As is the case with other issues in political philosophy, there is certainly a need here for philosophers to engage in a dialogue with social scientists.

Finally, we briefly presented Rawls's uses of the idea of publicity. The variety of ways in which he refers to it certainly shows the need for a more substantial mapping enterprise, at a strictly conceptual level. This could in turn indicate reasons to develop philosophical arguments in new directions.

Bibliography

Other Internet Resources

Related Entries

consequentialism | justification, political: public | Kant, Immanuel | Plato | privacy | public reason | Sidgwick, Henry

Acknowledgments

Many thanks to B. Baertschi, P. Destrée, P. Dietsch, B. Engelen, R. Gannett, A. Kahan, O. Klein, L. Langlois, C. Larrère, D. Naurin, T. Pogge, H. Pourtois, P. Pross, A. Roberts, M. Schwartzman, and A. Williams for very valuable suggestions and information. Earlier versions of this entry were presented at the universities of Montréal (2003), Bristol (2004), Louvain (2004) and St Louis (Brussels) (2004). I wish to warmly thank these audiences. The usual disclaimers apply.