Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy
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John Rawls

First published Tue Mar 25, 2008

John Rawls (b. 1921, d. 2002) was an American political philosopher in the liberal tradition. His theory of justice as fairness envisions a society of free citizens holding equal basic rights cooperating within an egalitarian economic system. His account of political liberalism addresses the legitimate use of political power in a democracy, aiming to show how enduring unity may be achieved despite the diversity of worldviews that free institutions allow. His writings on the law of peoples extend these theories to liberal foreign policy, with the goal of imagining how a peaceful and tolerant international order might be possible.

1. Life and Work

Rawls was born and raised in Baltimore, Maryland. His father was a prominent lawyer, his mother a chapter president of the League of Women Voters. Rawls studied at Princeton, where he was influenced by Wittgenstein's student Norman Malcolm; and at Oxford, where he worked with H. L. A. Hart, Isaiah Berlin, and Stuart Hampshire. His first professorial appointments were at Cornell and MIT. In 1962 Rawls joined the faculty at Harvard, where he taught for more than thirty years.

Rawls's adult life was a scholarly one: its major events occurred within his writings. The exceptions were two wars. As a college student Rawls had considered studying for the priesthood; as an infantryman in the Pacific in World War II he lost his Christian faith on seeing the capriciousness of death in combat and learning of the horrors of the Holocaust. Then in the 1960s Rawls spoke out against the US involvement in Vietnam. The Vietnam conflict impelled Rawls to analyze the defects in the American political system that led it to prosecute so ruthlessly what he saw as an unjust war, and to consider how citizens could conscientiously resist their government's aggressive policies.

Rawls's most significant achievement is his theory of a just liberal society, called justice as fairness. Rawls first set out justice as fairness in systematic detail in his 1971 book, A Theory of Justice. Rawls continued to rework justice as fairness throughout his life, restating the theory in Political Liberalism (1993), The Law of Peoples (1999), and Justice as Fairness (2001). Those interested in the evolution of justice as fairness from 1971 onwards should consult Freeman (2007). This entry reflects Rawls's final statement of his views on justice as fairness, as well as on political liberalism and on the law of peoples.

2. Aims and Method

2.1 Four Roles of Political Philosophy

Rawls sees political philosophy as fulfilling at least four roles in a society's public life. The first role is practical: political philosophy can discover bases for reasoned agreement in a society where sharp divisions threaten to lead to conflict. Rawls cites Hobbes's Leviathan as an attempt to solve the problem of order during the English civil war, and the Federalist Papers as emerging from the debate over the US Constitution.

A second role of political philosophy is to help citizens to orient themselves within their own social world. Philosophy can describe what it is to be a member of a society with a certain political status, and suggest how the nature and history of that society can be understood from a broader perspective.

A third role is to probe the limits of practicable political possibility. Political philosophy must describe workable political arrangements that can gain support from real people. Yet within these limits philosophy can be utopian: it can depict a social order that is the best that one can hope for. Given men as they are, as Rousseau said, philosophy imagines how laws might be.

A fourth role of political philosophy is reconciliation: “to calm our frustration and rage against our society and its history by showing us the way in which its institutions… are rational, and developed over time as they did to attain their present, rational form.” (JF, 3) Philosophy can show that human life is not simply domination and cruelty, prejudice, folly and corruption; but that in some ways at least it is better that it has become the way that it is.

Rawls viewed his own work as a practical contribution toward settling the long-standing conflict in democratic thought between liberty and equality, and toward describing the limits of civic and of international toleration. He offers the members of his own society a way of understanding themselves as free and equal citizens within a fair democratic polity, and describes a hopeful but limited vision of a stably just constitutional democracy doing its part within a peaceful international community. To individuals who are frustrated that their fellow citizens and fellow humans do not see the whole truth as they do, Rawls offers the reconciling thought that this diversity of worldviews results from, and can support, a social order with greater freedom for all.

2.2 The Sequence of Theories

In contrast to the utilitarian, for Rawls political philosophy is not simply applied moral philosophy. The utilitarian holds to one universal moral principle (“maximize utility”), which he applies to individual actions, political constitutions, international relations, and all other subjects as required. Rawls has no universal principle: “The correct regulative principle for anything,” he says, “depends on the nature of that thing.” (TJ, 29) Rawls confines his theorizing to the political domain, and within this domain held that the correct principles for each sub-domain depend on the character and relations of its agents.

Rawls covers the domain of the political by addressing its sub-domains in sequence. The first sub-domain he addresses is a self-contained democratic society reproducing itself across generations. Once principles are in place for such a society, Rawls moves to a second sub-domain: a society of nations of which this democratic society is a member. Rawls suggests (though he does not show) that his sequence of theories could be extended to cover further sub-domains, such as human interactions with animals. Universal coverage will have been achieved once this sequence is complete, each sub-domain having been assigned the principles appropriate to it.

2.3 Ideal and Non-Ideal Theory

Within each sub-domain of the political Rawls also follows a sequence: ideal theory before non-ideal theory. Ideal theory makes two types of idealizing assumptions about its subject matter. First, ideal theory assumes that all actors (citizens or societies) are generally willing to comply with whatever principles are chosen. Ideal theory thus idealizes away the possibility of law-breaking, either by individuals (crime) or societies (aggressive war). Second, ideal theory assumes reasonably favorable social conditions, wherein citizens and societies are able to abide by principles of political cooperation. Citizens are not so driven by hunger, for example, that their capacity for moral reasoning is overwhelmed; nor are nations struggling to overcome famine or the failure of their states.

Completing ideal theory first, Rawls says, yields a systematic understanding of how to reform our non-ideal world, and fixes a vision (mentioned above) of what is the best that can be hoped for. Once ideal theory is completed for a political sub-domain, non-ideal theory can be set out by reference to the ideal. For instance once we find ideal principles for citizens who can be productive members of society over a complete life, we will be better able to frame non-ideal principles for providing health care to citizens with serious illnesses or disabilities. Similarly, once we understand the ideal principles of international relations we will better see how the international community should act toward failed states, as well as toward aggressive states that menace the peace.

2.4 Reflective Equilibrium

The most abstract aim of political philosophy is to reach justified conclusions about how political institutions should be arranged. For Rawls how justified one is in one's political convictions depends on how close one is to achieving reflective equilibrium. In reflective equilibrium all of one's beliefs, on all levels of generality, cohere perfectly with one another. Thus in reflective equilibrium one's specific political judgments (e.g., “slavery is unjust,” “imprisonment without trial is unjust”) support one's more general political convictions (e.g., “all citizens have certain basic rights”) which support one's very abstract beliefs about oneself and one's world (e.g., “all citizens are free and equal”). Viewed from the opposite direction, in reflective equilibrium one's abstract beliefs explain one's more general convictions which in turn explain one's specific judgments. Were one to attain reflective equilibrium, the justification of each belief would follow from all beliefs relating in these networks of mutual support and explanation.

Though perfect reflective equilibrium is unattainable, one can use the method of reflective equilibrium to get closer to it and so increase the justifiability of one's beliefs. In carrying through this method one begins with one's considered moral judgments: those made consistently and without hesitation when one is under good conditions for thinking (e.g., “slavery is wrong,” “all citizens are political equals”). One treats these considered judgments as provisional fixed points, and then starts the process of bringing one's beliefs into relations of mutual support and explanation as described above. Doing this inevitably brings out conflicts where, for example, a specific judgment cannot support a more general conviction, or where an abstract belief cannot explain some belief that is less abstract. One proceeds by revising these beliefs as necessary, striving always to increase the coherence of the whole.

Carrying through this process of mutual adjustment brings one closer to narrow reflective equilibrium: coherence among one's initial beliefs. One then adds to this narrow equilibrium one's responses to the major theories in the history of political philosophy, as well as one's responses to theories critical of political philosophizing as such. One continues to make adjustments in one's scheme of beliefs as one reflects on these alternatives, aiming for the end-point of wide reflective equilibrium in which coherence is realized after many alternatives have been considered.

Because of its emphasis on coherence, reflective equilibrium is often contrasted with foundationalism as an account of justified belief. Within foundationalist approaches some subset of beliefs is considered to be unrevisable, thereby serving as a foundation on which all other beliefs are to be based. Reflective equilibrium privileges no such subset of beliefs: any belief at any level of generality is subject to revision, if revision will help to bring one's considered convictions into greater coherence overall.

2.5 The Independence of Moral and Political Theory

In working toward greater reflective equilibrium any type of belief could in principle be relevant to one's conclusions about how political institutions should be arranged. Metaphysical beliefs about free will or personal identity might be relevant, as could epistemological beliefs about how we come to know what moral facts there are. However, while this is true in principle Rawls holds that in practice productive moral and political theorizing will proceed to a large extent independent of metaphysics and epistemology. Indeed as a methodological presumption Rawls reverses the traditional order of priority. Progress in metaethics will derive from progress in substantive moral and political theorizing, instead of (as often assumed) vice versa. (CP, 286-302)

Rawls's own metaethical theory of the objectivity and validity of political judgments, political constructivism, will be described here after the substantive political theory from which it emerges.

3. Political Liberalism: Legitimacy and Stability within a Liberal Society

In a free society citizens will have disparate worldviews. They will believe in different religions or none at all; they will have differing conceptions of right and wrong; they will value various pursuits and forms of interpersonal relations. A democratic citizenry will have contrary commitments, yet in any country there can only be one law. The law must either establish a national church, or not; women must either have equal rights, or not; abortion and gay marriage must either be permissible under the constitution, or not; the economy must be set up in one way or another.

Rawls holds that the need to impose a unified law on a diverse citizenry raises two fundamental issues. The first is the issue of legitimacy: the legitimate use of coercive political power. In a democracy political power is always the power of the people as a collective body. How can it be legitimate for a democratic people to coerce all citizens to follow just one law, given that citizens will inevitably hold to different worldviews? The second issue is the issue of stability, which looks at political power from the receiving end. Why would a citizen willingly obey the law if it is imposed on her by a collective body many of whose members have beliefs and values quite dissimilar to her own? Yet unless most citizens willingly obey the law, no social order can be stable for long.

Rawls addresses these issues of legitimacy and stability within his theory of political liberalism. Political liberalism is not yet Rawls's theory of justice (justice as fairness). Political liberalism answers the conceptually prior questions of legitimacy and stability, thereby establishing the setting and starting points for justice as fairness.

3.1 Legitimacy: The Liberal Principle of Legitimacy

In light of the diversity within a democracy, what would it mean for citizens legitimately to exercise coercive political power over one another? Rawls's test for the acceptable use of political power in a democracy is his liberal principle of legitimacy:

Our exercise of political power is fully proper only when it is exercised in accordance with a constitution the essentials of which all citizens as free and equal may reasonably be expected to endorse in the light of principles and ideals acceptable to their common human reason. (PL, 137)

According to this principle political power may only be used in ways that all citizens can reasonably be expected to endorse. The use of political power must fulfill a criterion of reciprocity: citizens must reasonably believe that all citizens can reasonably accept the enforcement of a particular set of basic laws. Those coerced by law must be able to endorse the society's fundamental political arrangements freely, not because they are dominated or manipulated or kept uninformed.

The liberal principle of legitimacy frames the problem of legitimacy: how any particular set of basic laws can legitimately be imposed upon a pluralistic citizenry. Rawls's solution to this problem begins with the hope that many of the citizens of a democratic society will be reasonable.

3.2 Reasonable Citizens

Reasonable citizens want to live in a society in which they can cooperate with their fellow citizens on terms that are acceptable to all. They are willing to propose and abide by mutually acceptable rules, given the assurance that others will also do so; and they will honor these rules even when this means some sacrifice to their own interests. Reasonable citizens want, in short, to belong to a society where political power is legitimately used.

Each reasonable citizen has his own view about God and life, right and wrong, good and bad. Each has, that is, what Rawls calls his own comprehensive doctrine. Yet because reasonable citizens are reasonable, they are unwilling to impose their own comprehensive doctrines on others who are also willing to search for mutually agreeable rules. Though each may believe that he knows the truth, none is willing to force other reasonable citizens to live by that truth, even should he belong to a majority that has the power to enforce it.

One ground for reasonable citizens to be so tolerant, Rawls says, is that they accept a particular explanation for the diversity of worldviews in their society. Reasonable citizens accept the burdens of judgment. The deepest questions of religion, philosophy, and morality are very difficult even for conscientious people to think through, and people will answer these questions in different ways because of their own particular life experiences (their upbringing, class, occupation, and so on). Reasonable citizens understand that these deep issues are ones on which people of good will can disagree, and so will be unwilling to impose their own worldviews on those who have reached different conclusions.

3.3 Reasonable Pluralism and the Public Political Culture

Rawls's account of the reasonable citizen accords with his view of human nature. Humans are not irredeemably self-centered, dogmatic, or driven by what Hobbes called, “a perpetual and restless desire of power after power.” (1651, 58) Humans have at least the capacity for genuine toleration and mutual respect. This capacity gives hope that the diversity of worldviews in a democratic society may represent not merely pluralism, but reasonable pluralism. Rawls hopes, that is, that the religious, moral, and philosophical doctrines that citizens accept will themselves endorse toleration and accept the essentials of a democratic regime. In the religious sphere for example a reasonable pluralism might contain a reasonable Catholicism, a reasonable interpretation of Islam, a reasonable atheism, and so on. Being reasonable, none of these doctrines will advocate the use of coercive political power to impose conformity on non-believers.

The possibility of reasonable pluralism softens but does not solve the problem of legitimacy: how a particular set of basic laws can legitimately be imposed on a diverse citizenry. For even in a society of reasonable pluralism it would be unreasonable to expect everyone to endorse, say, a reasonable Catholicism as the basis for a constitutional settlement. Reasonable Muslims or atheists cannot be expected to endorse Catholicism as setting the basic terms for social life. Nor, of course, can Catholics be expected to accept Islam or atheism as the fundamental basis of law. No comprehensive doctrine can be accepted by all reasonable citizens, and so no comprehensive doctrine can serve as the basis for the legitimate use of coercive political power. Yet where else then to turn to find the ideas that will determine the society's most basic laws, which all citizens will be required to obey?

Since justification is addressed to others, it proceeds from what is, or can be, held in common; and so we begin from shared fundamental ideas implicit in the public political culture in the hope of developing from them a political conception that can gain free and reasoned agreement in judgment. (PL, 100-01)

There is only one source of fundamental ideas that can serve as a focal point for all reasonable citizens of a liberal society, which is the society's public political culture. The public political culture of a democratic society, Rawls says, “comprises the political institutions of a constitutional regime and the public traditions of their interpretation (including those of the judiciary), as well as historic texts and documents that are common knowledge.” (PL, 13-14) Rawls looks to fundamental ideas implicit, for example, in the design of the society's government, in the written constitution that specifies individual rights, and in the historic decisions of important courts. These fundamental ideas from the public political culture are then interpreted into a political conception of justice.

3.4 Political Conceptions of Justice

Rawls's solution to the problem of legitimacy in a liberal society is for political power to be exercised in accordance with a political conception of justice. A political conception of justice is a moral conception generated from the fundamental ideas implicit in the public political culture. A political conception is not derived from any particular comprehensive doctrine, nor is it a compromise among the worldviews that happen to exist in society at the moment. Rather a political conception is freestanding: its content is set out independently of the comprehensive doctrines that citizens affirm. Reasonable citizens, who want to cooperate with one another on mutually acceptable terms, will see that a freestanding political conception generated from ideas in the public political culture is the only basis for cooperation that all citizens can reasonably be expected to endorse. The use of coercive political power guided by the principles of a political conception of justice will therefore be legitimate coercion.

The three most fundamental ideas that Rawls finds in the public political culture of a democratic society are that citizens are free and equal, and that society should be a fair system of cooperation. All liberal political conceptions of justice will therefore be centered on interpretations of these three fundamental ideas. As there are many reasonable interpretations of free, equal and fair, there are many liberal political conceptions of justice. Since all the members of this family interpret the same fundamental ideas, however, all liberal political conceptions of justice will share certain basic features:

  1. A liberal political conception of justice will ascribe to all citizens familiar individual rights and liberties, such as rights of free expression, liberty of conscience, and free choice of occupation;
  2. A political conception will give special priority to these rights and liberties, especially over demands to further the general good (e.g., greater national wealth) or perfectionist values (e.g., the values of cultural flourishing);
  3. A political conception will assure for all citizens sufficient all-purpose means to make effective use of their freedoms.

These abstract features must, Rawls says, have concrete institutional realizations. He mentions several institutional features that all liberal political conceptions will share: fair opportunities for all citizens (especially in education and training); a decent distribution of income and wealth; government as the employer of last resort; basic health care for all citizens; and public financing of elections.

By Rawls's criteria a libertarian conception of justice (such as Nozick's in Anarchy, State, and Utopia) is not a liberal conception of justice. Libertarianism does not assure all citizens sufficient means to make use of their basic liberties, and it permits excessive inequalities of wealth and power. By contrast Rawls's own conception of justice (justice as fairness) does qualify as a member of the family of liberal political conceptions of justice. The use of political power in a liberal society will be legitimate if it is employed in accordance with the principles of any liberal conception of justice—justice as fairness, or some other.

3.5 Stability: An Overlapping Consensus

Political power is legitimately used in a liberal society when it is used in accordance with a political conception of justice. This still leaves undecided the problem of stability: why citizens would willingly obey the law as specified by a liberal political conception. Legitimacy means that the law may permissibly be enforced; Rawls needs another account of why citizens have reasons from within their own points of view to abide by such a law.

Rawls's hopes for a stable liberal society rest on an overlapping consensus. In an overlapping consensus, citizens support the same basic laws for different reasons. In Rawlsian terms, each citizen supports a political conception of justice for reasons internal to her own comprehensive doctrine. A political conception is freestanding: it is a “module” that can fit into any number of worldviews that citizens might have. In an overlapping consensus each reasonable citizen affirms this common “module” from within her own perspective.

The quotation below from the second Vatican Council illustrates how one comprehensive doctrine (Catholicism) affirms one component of a liberal political conception (a familiar individual liberty) from within its own perspective:

This Vatican Council declares that the human person has a right to religious freedom. This freedom means that all men are to be immune from coercion on the part of individuals or of social groups and of any human power, in such wise that in matters religious no one is forced to act in a manner contrary to his own beliefs. Nor is anyone to be restrained from acting in accordance with his own beliefs, whether privately or publicly, whether alone or in association with others, within due limits. The council further declares that the right to religious freedom has its foundation in the very dignity of the human person, as this dignity is known through the revealed Word of God and by reason itself. This right of the human person to religious freedom is to be recognized in the constitutional law whereby society is governed and thus it is to become a civil right. (1965, art. 2)

Catholic doctrine here supports the liberal right to religious freedom for reasons internal to Catholicism. A reasonable Islamic doctrine, and a reasonable atheistic doctrine, might also affirm this same right to religious freedom, each for its own reasons. In an overlapping consensus all reasonable comprehensive doctrines support not just this particular right, but a complete political conception of justice, each from within its own point of view.

Citizens within an overlapping consensus work out for themselves how the liberal “module” fits into their own worldviews. Some citizens may see liberalism as derived directly from their deepest beliefs, as in the quotation from Vatican II above. Others may accept a liberal conception as attractive in itself but mostly separate from their other concerns. All citizens will view the values of a political conception of justice as very great values that normally outweigh their other values should these conflict on some particular issue.

Rawls sees an overlapping consensus as the feasible basis of democratic stability that is the most desirable. Stability in an overlapping consensus is superior to a mere balance of power among citizens who hold contending worldviews. Any balance of power (or modus vivendi) might shift, and social stability then be lost. In an overlapping consensus citizens affirm a political conception wholeheartedly from within their own perspectives, and so will continue to do so even should their group gain or lose political power. Rawls says that an overlapping consensus is stable for the right reasons: each citizen affirms a moral doctrine (a liberal conception of justice) for moral reasons (as given by their comprehensive doctrine). Abiding by liberal basic laws is not a citizen's second-best compromise in the face of the power of others, but each citizen's first-best option given what they themselves believe.

Rawls does not assert that an overlapping consensus is achievable in every liberal society, or that once established one will always endure. Citizens in some societies may have too little in common to converge on a liberal political conception of justice, and in other societies unreasonable doctrines may spread until they overwhelm liberal institutions. Rawls does believe that history shows both deepening trust and convergence in beliefs among citizens in some liberal societies, which proves that an overlapping consensus can be possible. And he claims that where an overlapping consensus is possible, it is the best support for social stability that a free society can hope to attain.

3.6 Public Reason

Having seen how Rawls addresses the problems of legitimacy and stability we can return to legitimacy and its criterion of reciprocity: citizens must reasonably believe that all citizens can reasonably accept the enforcement of a particular set of basic laws. It is unreasonable for citizens to attempt to impose what they see as the whole truth on others—political power must be used in ways that all citizens may reasonably be expected to endorse. With his doctrine of public reason, Rawls extends this requirement of reciprocity to apply directly to how citizens explain their political decisions to one another. In essence, public reason requires citizens to be able to justify their political decisions to one another using publicly available values and standards.

To take a straightforward example: a Supreme Court justice deciding on a gay marriage law would violate public reason were she to base her opinion on God's forbidding gay sex in the book of Leviticus, or on a presentiment that upholding such a law would hasten the end of days. Not all members of society can reasonably be expected to accept Leviticus as stating an authoritative set of political values, nor can a religious premonition be a common standard for evaluating public policy. These values and standards are not public.

Rawls's doctrine of public reason can be summarized as follows:

Citizens engaged in certain political activities have a duty of civility to be able to justify their decisions on fundamental political issues by reference only to public values and public standards.

Each of the highlighted terms in this doctrine can be further elucidated as follows:

In an important proviso, Rawls adds that citizens may speak the language of their controversial comprehensive doctrines—even as public officials and even on the most fundamental issues—so long as what they say can be translated into the language of public reason. So President Lincoln, for instance, could legitimately condemn the evil of slavery using Biblical imagery, since his pronouncements could have been expressed in terms of the public values of freedom and equality. Thus even within its limited range of application, Rawls's doctrine of public reason is rather permissive concerning what citizens may say and do within the bounds of civility.

4. Justice as Fairness: Justice within a Liberal Society

Justice as fairness is Rawls's theory of justice for a liberal society. As a member of the family of liberal political conceptions of justice it provides a framework for the legitimate use of political power. Yet legitimacy is only the minimal standard of political acceptability; a political order can be legitimate without being just. Justice is the maximal moral standard: the full description of how a society's main institutions should be ordered.

Rawls constructs justice as fairness around specific interpretations of the defining liberal ideas that citizens are free and equal and that society should be fair. He holds that justice as fairness is the most egalitarian, and also the most plausible, interpretation of liberalism's fundamental concepts.

Rawls sees justice as fairness as answering to the demands of both freedom and equality, a challenge posed by the socialist critique of liberal democracy and by the conservative critique of the modern welfare state. Justice as fairness sets out a version of social contract theory that Rawls believes provides a superior understanding of justice to that of the dominant tradition in political philosophy: utilitarianism.

4.1 The Basic Structure of Society

Justice as fairness aims to describe a just arrangement of the major political and social institutions of a liberal society: the political constitution, the legal system, the economy, the family, and so on. The arrangement of these institutions is a society's basic structure. The basic structure is the location of justice because these institutions distribute the main benefits and burdens of social life, for example who will have which basic rights, who will have opportunities to get what kind of work, who will receive social recognition, what the distribution of income and wealth will be, and so on.

The form of a society's basic structure will have profound effects on the lives of citizens, influencing not only their prospects but more deeply their goals, their attitudes, their relationships, and their characters. Institutions that have such pervasive influence on people's lives require justification. Since leaving one's society is not a realistic option for most people, one cannot say that citizens have consented to the arrangement of their institutions by staying in the country. And since the rules of any basic structure will be coercively enforced, often with serious penalties, the demand to justify the imposition of any particular set of rules intensifies further.

In setting out justice as fairness Rawls assumes that the liberal society in question is marked by reasonable pluralism as described above, and also that it is under reasonably favorable conditions: that there are enough resources for it to be possible for everyone's basic needs to be met. Rawls makes the simplifying assumption that the society is self-sufficient and closed, so that citizens enter it only by birth and leave it only at death. He confines his attention mainly to ideal theory, prescinding from questions such as those of criminal justice.

4.2 Two Guiding Ideas of Justice as Fairness

Social cooperation in some form is necessary for citizens to be able to lead a decent life. Yet citizens are not indifferent to how the benefits and burdens of cooperation will be divided amongst them. Rawls's principles of justice as fairness embody the central liberal ideas that cooperation should be fair to all citizens regarded as free and equal. The distinctive interpretation that Rawls gives to these concepts can be seen in broad terms as a combination of a negative and a positive thesis.

The negative thesis is that citizens do not deserve to be born into a rich or a poor family, to be born naturally more gifted than others, to be born male or female, to be born a member of a particular racial group, and so on. Since these features of persons are in this sense morally arbitrary, citizens are not at the deepest level entitled to more or less of the benefits of social cooperation because of them. For example the fact that a citizen was born rich, white, and male in itself generates no reasons for this citizen to be either favored or disfavored by social institutions.

This negative thesis does not in itself say how social goods should be distributed; it merely clears the decks. Rawls's positive distributive thesis is equality-based reciprocity. All social goods are to be distributed equally, unless an unequal distribution would be to everyone's advantage. The guiding idea is that since citizens are fundamentally equal, reasoning about justice should begin from a presumption that cooperatively-produced goods should be equally divided. Justice then requires that any inequalities must benefit all citizens, and particularly must benefit those who will have the least. Equality sets the baseline; from there any inequalities must improve everyone's situation, and especially the situation of the worst-off. These strong requirements of equality and reciprocal advantage are hallmarks of Rawls's theory of justice.

4.3 The Two Principles of Justice as Fairness

These guiding ideas of justice as fairness are expressed in its two principles of justice:

First Principle: Each person has the same indefeasible claim to a fully adequate scheme of equal basic liberties, which scheme is compatible with the same scheme of liberties for all;

Second Principle: Social and economic inequalities are to satisfy two conditions:

  1. They are to be attached to offices and positions open to all under conditions of fair equality of opportunity;
  2. They are to be to the greatest benefit of the least-advantaged members of society (the difference principle). (JF, 42-43)

The first principle of equal basic liberties is to be used for designing the political constitution, while the second principle applies primarily to social and economic institutions. Fulfillment of the first principle takes priority over fulfillment of the second principle, and within the second principle fair equality of opportunity takes priority over the difference principle.

The first principle affirms for all citizens familiar basic rights and liberties: liberty of conscience and freedom of association, freedom of speech and liberty of the person, the rights to vote, to hold public office, to be treated in accordance with the rule of law, and so on. The principle ascribes these rights and liberties to all citizens equally. Unequal rights would not benefit those who would get a lesser share of rights, so justice requires equal rights for all in all normal circumstances.

Rawls's first principle accords with widespread convictions about the importance of equal basic rights and liberties. Two further features make this first principle distinctive. First, its priority: the basic rights and liberties are not to be traded off against other social goods like economic efficiency. The first principle disallows, for instance, a policy that would give draft exemptions to college students on the grounds that educated civilians will be more valuable to the economy. The draft is a drastic infringement on basic liberties, and if a draft is implemented then all who are able to serve must be equally subject to it.

The second distinctive feature of Rawls's first principle is that it requires fair value of the political liberties. The political liberties are a subset of the basic liberties, concerned with the rights to hold public office, the right to affect the outcome of national elections and so on. For these liberties Rawls requires that citizens be not only formally but also substantively equal. That is, citizens similarly endowed and motivated should have the same opportunities to hold office, to influence elections, and so on regardless of their social class. This fair value proviso has major implications for how elections should be funded and run, as described below.

Rawls's second principle of justice has two parts. The first part, fair equality of opportunity, requires that citizens with the same talents and willingness to use them have the same educational and economic opportunities regardless of whether they were born rich or poor. “In all parts of society there are to be roughly the same prospects of culture and achievement for those similarly motivated and endowed.” (JF, p. 44) So for example if we assume that natural endowments and willingness are evenly distributed across children born within the different social classes, then within any type of occupation (generally specified) we should find that roughly one quarter of people in that occupation were born into the top 25% of the income distribution, one quarter were born into the second-highest 25% of the income distribution, and so on. Since class of origin is a morally arbitrary fact about citizens, justice does not allow class of origin to turn into unequal real opportunities for education or meaningful work.

The second part of the second principle is the difference principle. The difference principle requires that social institutions be arranged so that inequalities of wealth and income work to the advantage of those who will be worst off. Starting from an imagined baseline of equality, a greater total product can be generated by allowing inequalities in wages and salaries: higher wages can cover the costs of training and education, for example, and can provide incentives to fill jobs that are more in demand. The difference principle requires that inequalities which increase the total product be to everyone's advantage, and specifically to the greatest advantage of those advantaged least.

Consider four hypothetical economic structures A-D, and the lifetime-average levels of income these would produce for representative members of three different groups:

Economy Least-Advantaged Group Middle Group Most-Advantaged Group
A 10,000 10,000 10,000
B 12,000 15,000 20,000
C 20,000 30,000 50,000
D 17,000 50,000 100,000

Here the difference principle selects Economy C, because it contains the distribution where the least-advantaged group does best. Inequalities in C are to everyone's advantage relative to an equal division (Economy A), and a more equal division (Economy B). But the difference principle does not allow the rich to get richer at the expense of the poor (Economy D). The difference principle embodies equality-based reciprocity: from an egalitarian baseline it requires inequalities that are good for all, and particularly for the worst-off.

The difference principle gives expression to the idea that natural endowments are undeserved. A citizen does not merit more of the social product simply because she was lucky enough to be born with gifts that are in great demand. Yet this does not mean that everyone must get the same shares. The fact that citizens have different talents and abilities can be used to make everyone better off. In a society governed by the difference principle citizens regard the distribution of natural endowments as an asset that benefits all. Those better endowed are welcome to use their gifts to make themselves better off, so long as their doing so also contributes to the good of those less well endowed. “In justice as fairness,” Rawls says, “men agree to share one another's fate.” (TJ, 102)

4.4 The Conception of Citizens

Having surveyed Rawls's two principles of justice as fairness, we can return to begin Rawls's official argument for these two principles. This official argument is based on Rawls's interpretations of the central liberal ideas that citizens are free and equal and that society should be fair. Rawls's conceptions of citizens and society are then used to build the official argument that favors the two principles: the argument from the original position.

Rawls's interpretation of citizens as free is as follows. Citizens are free in that each sees himself as being entitled to make claims on social institutions in his own right—citizens are not slaves or serfs, dependent for their social status on others. Citizens are also free in that they see their public identities as uncoupled from any particular comprehensive doctrine: a citizen who converts to Islam or recants his faith will expect, for example, to maintain the same political rights and liberties through these transitions. Finally citizens are free in being able to take responsibility for planning their own lives, given the opportunities and resources that they can reasonably expect.

Citizens are equal in virtue of having the capacities to participate in social cooperation over a complete life. Citizens may have greater or lesser skills, talents, and powers “above the line” required to cooperate, but differences above this line have no bearing on citizens' underlying equal status.

In Rawls's conception citizens are not only free and equal, they are also reasonable and rational. The idea that citizens are reasonable is familiar from political liberalism. Reasonable citizens have the capacity to abide by fair terms of cooperation, even at the expense of their own interests, provided that others are also willing to do so. In justice as fairness Rawls calls this reasonableness the capacity for a sense of justice. Citizens are also conceived as rational: they have the capacity to pursue and revise their own view of what is valuable in human life. Rawls calls this the capacity for a conception of the good. Together these underlying capacities are the two moral powers.

Like every theory of justice (for example those of Hobbes, Locke, and Mill), justice as fairness requires an account of citizens' fundamental interests: what citizens need as such. Rawls derives his account of primary goods from the conception of the citizen as reasonable and rational. Primary goods are essential for developing and exercising the two moral powers, and useful for pursuing a wide range of specific conceptions of the good life. Primary goods are:

All citizens are assumed have fundamental interests in getting more of these primary goods, and political institutions are to evaluate how well citizens are doing according to what primary goods they have. It is equality and inequality of primary goods that, Rawls claims, are of the greatest political importance.

4.5 The Conception of Society

Rawls's conception of society is defined by fairness: social institutions are to be fair to all cooperating members of society, regardless of their race, gender, religion, class of origin, reasonable conception of the good life, and so on.

Rawls also emphasizes publicity as an aspect of fairness. In what he calls a well-ordered society the principles that order the basic structure are publicly known to do so, and the justifications for these principles are knowable by and acceptable to all reasonable citizens. The idea behind publicity is that since the principles for the basic structure will be coercively enforced, they should stand up to public scrutiny. The publicity condition requires that a society's operative principles of justice be neither esoteric nor ideological screens for deeper power relations: that in “public political life, nothing need be hidden.” (PL, 68)

4.6 The Original Position

Rawls's conceptions of citizens and society are still quite abstract, and some might think innocuous. The original position aims to move from these abstract conceptions to determinate principles of social justice. It does so by translating the question: “What are fair terms of social cooperation for free and equal citizens?” into the question “What terms of cooperation would free and equal citizens agree to under fair conditions?” The move to agreement among citizens is what places Rawls's justice as fairness within the social contract tradition of Locke, Rousseau and Kant.

The strategy of the original position is to construct a method of reasoning that models abstract ideas about justice so as to focus their power together onto the choice of principles. So Rawls's conceptions of citizens as free and equal and of society as fair are built into the design of the original position itself. Rawls's intent is that readers will see the outcome of the original position as justified because they will see how it embodies plausible understandings of citizens and society, and also because this outcome confirms many of their considered convictions about justice on specific issues.

The original position is a thought experiment: an imaginary situation in which each real citizen has a representative, and all of these representatives come to an agreement on which principles of justice should order the political institutions of the real citizens. Were actual citizens to get together in real time to try to agree to principles of justice for their society the bargaining among them would be influenced by all sorts of factors irrelevant to justice, such as who could appear most threatening or who could hold out longest. The original position abstracts from all such irrelevant factors. In effect the original position is a situation in which each citizen is represented as only a free and equal citizen, as wanting only what free and equal citizens want, and as trying to agree to principles for the basic structure while situated fairly with respect to other citizens. For example citizens' basic equality is modeled in the original position by imagining that the parties who represent real citizens are symmetrically situated: no citizen's representative is able to threaten any other citizen's representative, or to hold out longer for a better deal.

The most striking feature of the original position is the veil of ignorance, which prevents other arbitrary facts about citizens from influencing the agreement among their representatives. As we have seen, Rawls holds that the fact that a citizen is for example of a certain race, class, and gender is no reason for social institutions to favor or disfavor him. Each party in the original position is therefore deprived of knowledge of the race, class, and gender of the real citizen they represent. In fact the veil of ignorance deprives the parties, Rawls says, of all facts about citizens that are irrelevant to the choice of principles of justice: not only their race, class, and gender but also their age, natural endowments, and more. Moreover the veil of ignorance also screens out specific information about the citizens' society so as to get a clearer view of the permanent features of a just social system.

Behind the veil of ignorance, the informational situation of the parties that represent real citizens is as follows:

The veil of ignorance is intended to situate the representatives of free and equal citizens fairly with respect to one another. No party can press for agreement on principles that will arbitrarily favor the particular citizen they represent, because no party knows the specific attributes of the citizen they represent. The situation of the parties thus embodies reasonable conditions, within which the parties can make a rational agreement. Each party tries to agree to principles that will be best for the citizen they represent (i.e., that will maximize that citizen's share of primary goods). Since the parties are fairly situated, the agreement they reach will be fair to all actual citizens.

The set-up of the original position also models other aspects of Rawls's conceptions of citizens and society. For example the publicity of a well-ordered society is modeled by the fact that the parties must choose among principles that can be publicly endorsed by all citizens. There are also some assumptions that make the hypothetical agreement determinate and decisive: the parties are not motivated by envy (i.e., by how much citizens besides their own end up with); the parties are not assumed to be either risk-seeking or risk-averse; and the parties must make a final agreement on principles for the basic structure: there are no “do-overs” after the veil of ignorance is lifted and the parties learn which real citizen they represent.

4.7 The Argument from the Original Position: The Selection of Principles

The argument from the original position has two parts. In the first part the parties agree to principles of justice. In the second part the parties check that a society ordered by these principles could be stable over time. Rawls only attempts to show that his two principles of justice would be favored over utilitarian principles, since he sees utilitarianism as the main competing tradition of reasoning about justice. The parties are thus presented with a choice between Rawls's two principles and utilitarian principles, and asked which principles they would prefer to agree to.

The first part of the original position contains two comparisons between Rawls's two principles and utilitarian principles. In the first comparison the parties compare the two principles to the principle of average utility: the principle that the basic structure should be arranged so as to produce the highest level of utility averaged among all citizens.

In this first comparison Rawls argues that the parties would prefer his two principles to average utility because it is rational for the parties here to use maximin reasoning: to maximize the minimum level of primary goods that the citizens they represent might find themselves with. Under average utilitarianism the basic liberties of some citizens might be restricted for the sake of greater benefits to other citizens. For example, restrictions on the political and religious liberties of a weak minority might benefit the majority and so lead to a higher average overall. A party in the original position would find the possibility that their citizen might be a member of such a weak minority intolerable, given that the party could secure equal liberties for their citizen by choosing the two principles instead. A party would not be taking seriously the political standing and deepest commitments of the citizen they represent, Rawls argues, were they to gamble with their citizen's basic liberties by favoring average utility.

Moreover, Rawls says, a society governed by his two principles has other advantages over a utilitarian society. Securing equal basic liberties for all encourages a spirit of cooperation among citizens on the basis of mutual respect, taking divisive conflicts about whether to deny liberties to certain groups off of the political agenda. By contrast a utilitarian society would be riven by mutual suspicions, as different groups put forward highly speculative arguments that average utility could be increased by implementing various partisan policies. The two principles, by requiring permanent equal liberties for all, increase social harmony by making it much easier for justice to be seen to be done. The balance of considerations in favor of the two principles over average utility is, Rawls claims, decisive.

The second comparison in the first part of the original position is between the two principles and the principle of restricted utility, which is identical to Rawls's two principles except that the difference principle is replaced with a principle of average utility to regulate the distribution of wealth and income, constrained by a social minimum. While the first comparison turned on the importance of the basic liberties, the second scrutinizes the reasons for the difference principle.

Maximin reasoning plays no role in the argument for the difference principle, nor does aversion to uncertainty. (JF, xvii, 43, 95, 96) Rather, the parties will favor Rawls's two principles because these provide a better basis for enduring cooperation among all citizens. The two principles ask less of the better-off than restricted utility asks of the worst-off. Under the two principles those who are better endowed are permitted to gain more wealth and income, on the condition that their doing so also benefits their fellow citizens. Under restricted utility, in contrast, those living at the minimum will suspect that their interests have been sacrificed to make the better-off better off still. These citizens at the minimum may become cynical about their society, and withdraw from active participation in public life. Moreover, it is again difficult to maintain a public agreement as to which policies actually will maximize average utility, and debates over for example where to set the social minimum may lead to mistrust among social classes. The difference principle encourages mutual trust and the cooperative virtues by instantiating an ideal of economic reciprocity. Each party will see the advantages of securing such a social world for the citizen they represent.

4.8 The Argument from the Original Position: The Check for Stability

Having selected the two principles of justice as fairness, the parties next check that these principles can order a society stably over time. They check, that is, whether those who grow up under institutions arranged by these principles will develop sufficient willingness to abide by them that the principles can serve as the focus of an enduring overlapping consensus.

Rawls argues that his two principles are congruent with each citizen's good. Under the two principles the society's basic institutions affirm the freedom and equality of each citizen, giving a firm public basis to each citizen's self-respect. Citizens will see that the basic liberties allow sufficient social space to pursue their reasonable conceptions of the good. Citizens will tend to be neither envious nor imperious due to their economic situation, as they will see how the economy works toward the reciprocal advantage of all. And they can reflect on the collective good that they all can achieve together by working to maintain just institutions over time.

Given that the two principles are congruent with citizens' good, Rawls argues that it is reasonable to suppose that citizens will develop a desire to act in accordance with them. It is a deep thesis in Rawls's understanding of moral psychology that people will become attached to people and institutions that they see benefitting them and those close to them. The two principles create a social world in which each can pursue his own ends on a basis of mutual respect with others. Since this is experienced as a good, the principles will gain citizens' willing and stable allegiance. “The most stable conception of justice,” Rawls says, “is one that is perspicuous to our reason, congruent with our good, and rooted not in abnegation but in affirmation of the self.” (TJ, 261)

4.9 Institutions: The Four-Stage Sequence

The two parts of the argument for the two principles of justice just surveyed occur at the first stage of the original position. At this stage the parties also agree to a principle of just savings to regulate how much one generation must save for future generations. Since the parties do not know which era the citizens they represent live in, it is rational for them to choose a savings principle that is fair to all generations. Rawls says that the parties need not choose a savings principle that requires endless economic growth. Rather, the parties may prefer a Millian economic “steady state” once a generation has been reached in which the two principles are satisfied.

After agreeing on the two principles and a principle of just savings, the parties then proceed further through the four-stage sequence, tailoring these general principles to the particular conditions of the society of the citizens they represent. The veil of ignorance that screens out information about society's general features is gradually thinned, and the parties use the new information to decide on progressively more determinate applications of the two principles.

At the second stage the parties are given more information about the society's political culture and economic development, and take on the task of crafting a constitution that realizes the two principles. At the third stage the parties learn still more about the details of the society, and agree to specific laws and policies that realize the two principles within the constitutional framework decided at the second stage. At the final stage the parties have full information about the society, and reason as judges and administrators to apply the previously-agreed laws and policies to particular cases. When the four stages are complete the principles of justice as fairness are fully articulated for the society's political life.

To illustrate: at the constitutional and legislative stages the parties specify abstract basic liberties such as “freedom of thought” into more particular rights like the right to free political speech, which is then further specified as the right to criticize the government, the special rights of the press, and so on. The parties also adjust the basic liberties to fit with one another and with other values, always using as a touchstone what overall scheme of liberties will enable citizens to develop and exercise their two moral powers and pursue their determinate conceptions of the good. (PL, 289-371) At these stages the parties also work out the institutions necessary to realize the fair value of the equal political liberties. On this topic Rawls is adamant: unless there is public funding of elections, restrictions on campaign contributions, and substantially equal access to the media, politics will be captured by concentrations of private economic power, making it impossible for equally-able citizens to have equal opportunities to influence politics regardless of their class.

The parties attempt to realize the second principle of justice at the legislative stage by shaping the laws that regulate property, contract, inheritance, taxation, hiring and minimum wages, and so on. Their task is not to allocate some fixed set of goods that appear from nowhere, but rather to devise a set of institutions for training, production, and distribution whose operation will realize fair equality of opportunity and the difference principle over time.

For fair equality of opportunity Rawls emphasizes that laws and policies must go beyond merely preventing discrimination in education and hiring. To ensure fair opportunity regardless of social class of origin, the state must also fund high-quality education for the less well off. Moreover the state must also guarantee both a basic minimum income and health care for all.

For the difference principle Rawls says that the goal is an economic order that maximizes the position of the worst off group (e.g., unskilled laborers, or those with less than half the median wealth and income over their lifetimes). Given that institutions realizing the prior principles are already in place, this should be approximately achievable by, for example, varying marginal rates of tax and exemptions.

Rawls explicitly rejects the welfare state. (JF, 137-40) Welfare state capitalism leaves control of the economy in the hands of a group of rich private actors. It therefore fails to ensure for all citizens enough resources to have even roughly equal chances of influencing politics, or to have sufficiently equal opportunity in education and employment. The welfare state tends therefore to generate a demoralized under-class. Laissez-faire capitalism is even worse for equality than the welfare state along these dimensions. And a socialist command economy puts too much power in the hands of the state, again endangering political equality and also threatening basic liberties such as free choice of employment.

Justice as fairness, Rawls says, favors either a property owning democracy or democratic socialism. The government of a property owning democracy takes steps to encourage widespread ownership of productive assets and broad access to education and training; democratic socialism is similar but features worker-managed firms. The aim of both systems of political economy is to enable all citizens, even the least advantaged, to manage their own affairs within a context of significant social and economic equality. “The least advantaged are not, if all goes well, the unfortunate and unlucky—objects of our charity and compassion, much less our pity—but those to whom reciprocity is owed as a matter of basic justice.” (JF, 139)

4.10 The Original Position and Political Constructivism

Rawls puts forward the original position as a useful device for reaching greater reflective equilibrium. He holds that the value of the original position as a method of reasoning is affirmed when it selects the first principle of justice, since the first principle accords with many people's deep convictions about the importance of assuring the basic rights and liberties for all. Having gained credibility by confirming these settled moral judgments, the original position then goes on to select principles for issues on which people's judgments may be less certain, such as how society should structure employment opportunities and what a just distribution of wealth and income might be.

In this way the original position first confirms and then extends judgments about justice. For Rawls it is important that the same method of reasoning that explains equal basic rights also justifies more political and economic equality than many people might have initially expected. The momentum of the argument for the first principle carries through to the argument for the second principle. Those who believe in equal basic rights, but who reject the other egalitarian features of justice as fairness, must try to find some other route to justifying those basic rights.

The original position is also the crux of Rawls's metaethical theory, political constructivism. Political constructivism is Rawls's account of the objectivity and validity of political judgments. The original position embodies, Rawls says, all of the relevant conceptions of person and society and principles of practical reasoning for making judgments about justice. When there is an overlapping consensus focused on justice as fairness, the original position specifies a shared public perspective from which all citizens can reason about the principles of justice and their application to the society's institutions. Judgments made from this perspective are then objectively correct, in the sense of giving reasons to citizens to act regardless of their actual motivations or the reasons they think they have within their particular points of view. Political constructivism does not maintain that the principles of justice are true: questions of truth are ones about which reasonable citizens may disagree, and are to be addressed by each citizen from within their own comprehensive doctrine. Judgments made from the original position are, however, valid, or as Rawls says, reasonable.

5. The Law of Peoples: Liberal Foreign Policy

With the theories of legitimacy and justice for a self-contained liberal society completed, Rawls then extends his approach to address international relations with the next in his sequence of theories: the law of peoples.

Rawls takes it as a constraint of realism that no tolerable world state could be stable. He cites Kant in asserting that a world government would either be a global despotism or beleaguered by battles against various groups trying to gain their political independence. The law of peoples will be international, not cosmopolitan: it will guide a liberal society in its interactions with other societies, both liberal and non-liberal.

Rawls describes the main ideas motivating his law of peoples as follows:

Two main ideas motivate the Law of Peoples. One is that the great evils of human history—unjust war and oppression, religious persecution and the denial of liberty of conscience, starvation and poverty, not to mention genocide and mass murder—follow from political injustice, with its own cruelties and callousness… The other main idea, obviously connected with the first, is that, once the gravest forms of political injustice are eliminated by following just (or at least decent) social policies and establishing just (or at least decent) basic institutions, these great evils will eventually disappear. (LP, 6-7)

The most important feature of the “realistic utopia” that Rawls envisages is that the great evils of human history are absent. The most important condition for this realistic utopia to obtain is that all societies are internally well-ordered: that all have just, or at least decent, domestic political institutions.

5.1 The International Basic Structure and the Principles of the Law of Peoples

Much of Rawls's presentation of the law of peoples parallels that of justice as fairness and political liberalism. As there is a basic structure of institutions within a liberal society so, Rawls says, there is an international basic structure. (LP, 33, 62, 114, 115, 122, 123) While Rawls does not say that the international basic structure has a pervasive impact on the life chances of individuals, the rules of this basic structure may be coercively enforced (for example, Iraq's invasion of Kuwait in 1990 was coercively reversed by a coalition of other countries). The principles that regulate this international basic structure thus require justification. The justification of these principles must accommodate the fact that there is even more pluralism in worldviews among contemporary societies than there is within a single liberal society.

Rawls puts forward eight principles for ordering the international basic structure:

  1. Peoples are free and independent, and their freedom and independence are to be respected by other peoples.
  2. Peoples are to observe treaties and undertakings.
  3. Peoples are equal and are parties to the agreements that bind them.
  4. Peoples are to observe the duty of nonintervention (except to address grave violations of human rights).
  5. Peoples have a right of self-defense, but no right to instigate war for reasons other than self defense.
  6. Peoples are to honor human rights.
  7. Peoples are to observe certain specified restrictions in the conduct of war.
  8. Peoples have a duty to assist other peoples living under unfavorable conditions that prevent their having a just or decent political and social regime. (LP, 37)

All of these principles, with the exception of the last one, are familiar from contemporary international law (though Rawls's list of human rights for principles 4 and 6 is shorter than the list in international law). Rawls also leaves room for his law of peoples to accommodate various organizations that may help societies to increase their political and economic coordination, such as idealized versions of a United Nations, a World Trade Organization, and a World Bank.

5.2 Peoples: Liberal and Decent

The actors in Rawls's international theory are not individuals (citizens) but societies (peoples). A people is a group of individuals ruled by a common government, bound together by common sympathies, and firmly attached to a common conception of right and justice. The government of a people takes responsibility for maintaining environmental and population policies so that the territory can support the citizenry over time. “People” is a moralized concept, and not all countries currently on the world map qualify as such.

Rawls's conception of peoples within the law of peoples parallels his conception of citizens within justice as fairness. Peoples see themselves as free in the sense of being rightfully politically independent; and as equal in regarding themselves as equally deserving of recognition and respect. Peoples are reasonable in that they will honor fair terms of cooperation with other peoples, even in cases where they might advance their rational interests by violating those terms, given that other peoples will also do so. Reasonable peoples are thus unwilling to try to impose their political or social ideals on other reasonable peoples. They satisfy the criterion of reciprocity with respect to one another.

Rawls describes the fundamental interests of a people as follows:

Rawls contrasts peoples with states. A state, Rawls says, is moved by the desires to enlarge its territory, or to convert other societies to its religion, or to enjoy the power of ruling over others, or to increase its relative economic strength. Peoples are not states, and as we will see peoples may regard societies that act on such desires as outlaws.

Peoples are of two types, depending on the nature of their domestic political institutions. Liberal peoples satisfy the requirements of political liberalism: they have legitimate liberal constitutions, with governments that are under popular control and not driven by large concentration of private economic power.

Decent peoples are not internally just from a liberal perspective, since their basic institutions do not recognize reasonable pluralism or realize the liberal ideas of free and equal citizens cooperating fairly. The institutions of a decent society may be organized around a single comprehensive doctrine, such as a dominant religion. The political system may not be democratic, and women or members of minority religions may be excluded from public office. Nevertheless decent peoples are well-ordered enough, Rawls says, to merit equal membership in international society.

Like all peoples, decent peoples do not have aggressive foreign policies. Beyond this Rawls describes one type of decent society—a decent hierarchical society—to illustrate what decency requires. A decent hierarchical society's basic structure specifies a decent system of social cooperation. First, it secures a core list of human rights. Second, its political system takes the fundamental interests of all persons into account through a decent consultation hierarchy. This means that the government genuinely consults with the representatives of all groups, which together represent all persons in the society, and that the government justifies its laws and policies to these groups. The government does not close down protests, and responds to any protests with conscientious replies. The government also supports the right of citizens to emigrate.

Rawls imagines a decent hierarchical society he calls “Kazanistan.” Here Islam is the favored religion, and only Muslims can hold the high office. However non-Muslim religions may be practiced without fear, and believers in them are encouraged to take part in civic culture of the wider society. Minorities are not subject to arbitrary discrimination by law, or treated as inferior by Muslims. Kazanistan would qualify, Rawls says, as a well-ordered member of the society of peoples.

5.3 International Toleration and Human Rights

Liberal peoples tolerate decent peoples, and indeed treat them as equals. Not to do so, Rawls says, would be to fail to express sufficient respect for acceptable ways of ordering a society. Liberal peoples should recognize the good of national self-determination, and let decent societies decide their futures for themselves. The government of a liberal people should not criticize decent peoples for failing to be liberal, or set up incentives for them to become more so. Criticism and inducements may cause bitterness and resentment in the decent people, and so be counter-productive.

Indeed public reason imposes duties of civility upon the members of international society, just as it does upon members of a liberal society. Government officials and candidates for high office should explain their foreign policy positions to other peoples in terms of the principles and values of the law of peoples, and should avoid reliance on contentious parochial reasons that all peoples cannot reasonably share.

One major reason that liberal peoples tolerate decent peoples, Rawls says, is that decent peoples secure for all persons within their territory a core list of human rights. These core human rights include rights to subsistence, security, personal property, and formal equality before the law, as well as freedoms from slavery, protections of ethnic groups against genocide, and some measure of liberty of conscience (but not, as we have seen, a right to democratic participation). These core human rights are the minimal conditions required for persons to be able to engage in social cooperation in any real sense, so any well-ordered society must protect them.

The role of human rights in the law of peoples is thus to set limits on international toleration. Any society that guarantees Rawls's list of human rights is to be immune from coercive intervention from other peoples. Societies that violate human rights overstep the limits of toleration, and may rightly be subject to economic sanctions or even military attack.

5.4 The International Original Position

The international original position parallels the domestic original position of justice as fairness. This original position answers the question: “What terms of cooperation would free and equal peoples (liberal and decent) agree to under fair conditions?” The strategy is to build the conception of peoples into the set-up of this original position, along with restrictions on reasons for favoring basic principles of international law: to describe reasonable conditions under which a rational agreement on principles can be made.

In the international original position representatives of each people agree on principles for the international basic structure. Each party is behind a veil of ignorance, deprived of information about the people it represents such as the size of its territory and population, and its relative political and economic strength. Each party tries to do the best it can for the people it represents, in terms of the fundamental interests that all peoples have.

Rawls claims that the parties in the international original position would favor the eight principles listed above. Starting from a baseline of equality and independence, the parties would see no reason to introduce inequalities into the relationships among peoples (beyond certain functional inequalities in the design of cooperative organizations, such as richer countries contributing more to an idealized United Nations). The parties would reject international utilitarian principles, as no people is prepared to accept that it should sacrifice its fundamental interests for the sake of greater total global utility.

After selecting the eight principles of the law of peoples, the parties next check that these principles can stably order international relations over time. Analogously to the domestic case, the parties will see that the principles of the law of peoples affirm the good of peoples, and that peoples will develop trust and confidence in one another as all willingly abide by these principles over time. The stability of the international political order will thus be stability for the right reasons (and not a mere modus vivendi), since each people will affirm the principles as its first-best option whatever the international balance of power might become.

Rawls also attempts to draw empirical support for his stability argument from the literature on the democratic peace. Social scientists have found that historically democracies have tended not to go to war with one another. Rawls explains this by saying that liberal societies are, because of their internal political structures, satisfied. Liberal peoples have no desires for imperial glory, territorial expansion, or to convert others to their religion, and whatever they need from other countries they can gain through trade. Liberal peoples, Rawls says, have no reasons to fight aggressive wars, so a genuine peace can endure among them. And since decent peoples are defined as non-aggressive, any decent people can join this liberal peace as well.

Once the parties have agreed to the eight principles of the law of peoples, they then continue to specify these principles more precisely in a process analogous to the domestic four-stage sequence.

5.5 Non-Ideal Theory: Outlaw States and Burdened Societies

The principles selected in the international original position contain provisions for non-ideal situations: situations in which nations are unwilling to comply with the ideal principles, or are unable to cooperate on their terms. These provisions are embedded in principles 4 through 8 of the law of peoples.

Outlaw states are non-compliant: they threaten the peace by attempting to expand their power and influence, or by violating the human rights of those within their territory. The principles of the law of peoples allow peoples to fight these outlaw states in self-defense, and to take coercive actions against them to stop the violation of human rights. In any military confrontations with outlaws, peoples must obey the principles of the just prosecution of war such as avoiding direct attacks on enemy civilians in all but the most desperate circumstances. The aim of war, Rawls says, is to bring all societies to honor the law of peoples, and eventually to become fully participating members of international society.

Burdened societies struggle with social and economic conditions that make it difficult for them to maintain either liberal or decent institutions. They may lack sufficient material or social resources to support a scheme of social cooperation, perhaps having allowed population growth beyond their territory's current means. The law of peoples (eighth principle) requires that burdened peoples be assisted until they can handle their own affairs (i.e., become well-ordered). Rawls holds that it is the basic structure of a society and its political culture that are most essential for its self-sufficiency; yet there are situations in which the international community must help a burdened society to rise above that threshold. This duty of assistance is Rawls's greatest divergence from the rules of current international law. Accepting this duty would require significant changes in how nations now respond to global poverty and failed states.

5.6 Reconciliation and Realistic Utopia

Rawls's vision is of a perpetually peaceful cooperative international order, where liberal and decent peoples stand ready to pacify aggressive states, to secure core human rights, and to help struggling countries so long as they need assistance.

To some degree this is a vision of limited ambition. Officials of democratic societies can do little more than hope that merely decent societies will become internally more tolerant and democratic. Once the duty to assist burdened peoples is satisfied there are no further requirements on economic distribution within Rawls's law of peoples: inequalities across national borders are of no political concern as such. Individuals around the world may suffer greatly from bad luck, and may be haunted by spiritual emptiness. The practical goal of Rawls's law of peoples is the elimination of the great evils of human history: unjust war and oppression, religious persecution and the denial of liberty of conscience, starvation and poverty, genocide and mass murder. The limits of this ambition mean that there will be much in the world to which Rawls's political philosophy offers no reconciliation.

Nevertheless, while Rawls's vision is realistic it is also utopian. To believe that Rawls's vision is possible is to believe that individuals are not merely selfish or amoral, and that international relations can be more than a contest for power, wealth, and glory. Affirming the possibility of a just and peaceful future can inoculate against a resignation or cynicism that might otherwise seem inevitable. “By showing how the social world may realize the features of a realistic utopia, political philosophy provides a long-term goal of political endeavor, and in working toward it gives meaning to what we can do today.” (LP, 128)

6. Further Reading

Beyond the texts by Rawls cited above, readers may wish to consult Rawls's lectures on Hume, Leibniz, Kant, and Hegel (LHMP) and on Hobbes, Locke, Hume, Mill, Marx, Sidgwick, and Butler (LHPP) to see how Rawls's interpretations of these authors informed his own theorizing. Reath, Herman, and Korsgaard (1997) is a collection of essays by Rawls's students on his work in the history of philosophy.

Freeman (2007) sets out in a single volume the historical development of Rawls's theories, as well as sympathetic elaborations of many central arguments. Pogge (2007) is a crisp, rigorous examination of Rawls's domestic theories, which also contains a biographical sketch and brief replies to libertarian and communitarian critics (for which see also Pogge (1989)). Both books contain extensive bibliographies.

Freeman (2003) is a recent collection of mostly friendly essays on major themes in and criticisms of Rawls's domestic theories; it also contains an introductory overview of all of Rawls's theories. Historically the most influential volume of essays on justice as fairness has been Daniels (1975). Collections on political liberalism include Griffin and Solum (1994), Lloyd (1994), and Davion and Wolf (1999). Martin and Reidy (2006) focuses on the law of peoples. Fleming (2004) is a recent symposium on Rawls and the law.

Readers who can gain access (usually through a library) to Kukathas (2003, 4 volumes) or Richardson and Weithman (1999, 5 volumes) will find many of the most important critical articles on Rawls's work, divided according to specific themes (e.g., maximin reasoning, public reason) and types of criticisms (e.g., conservative critiques, feminist critiques). Readers without access to these volumes can find their tables of contents online here ( Richardson and Weithman [1], 2, 3, 4, 5), and can then locate the articles desired in their original places of publication.

Bibliography

Works by Rawls Cited in this Entry

1971 A Theory of Justice [TJ], Cambridge, MA: Harvard University Press. Revised edition, 1999. The page citations in this entry are to the 1971 edition.
1993 Political Liberalism [PL], New York: Columbia University Press. Paperback edition, 1996; Second edition, 2005.
1999 The Law of Peoples [LP], Cambridge, MA: Harvard University Press.
1999 Collected Papers [CP], S. Freeman (ed.), Cambridge, MA: Harvard University Press.
1999 Lectures on the History of Moral Philosophy [LHMP], B. Herman (ed.), Cambridge, MA: Harvard University Press.
2001 Justice as Fairness: A Restatement [JF], E. Kelly (ed.), Cambridge, MA: Harvard University Press.
2007 Lectures on the History of Political Philosophy [LHPP], S. Freeman (ed.), Cambridge, MA: Harvard University Press

Secondary Sources

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