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The Early Development of Set Theory

First published Tue Apr 10, 2007

Set theory is one of the greatest achievements of modern mathematics. With few significant exceptions, all mathematical concepts, methods, and results admit of representation within axiomatic set theory. Thus set theory has served quite a unique role by systematizing (almost) the whole of modern mathematics, and approaching in a unified form all basic questions about admissible mathematical arguments — including the thorny question of existence principles. This entry covers in outline the convoluted process by which set theory came into being, covering roughly the years 1850 to 1908.

In 1910, Hilbert wrote that set theory is “that mathematical discipline which today occupies an outstanding role in our science, and radiates [ausströmt] its powerful influence into all branches of mathematics”. This already suggests that, in order to discuss the early history, it is necessary to distinguish two aspects of set theory: its role as a fundamental language and repository of the basic principles of modern mathematics; and its role as an independent branch of mathematics, classified (today) as a branch of mathematical logic. Both aspects are considered here. The first section examines the origins and emergence of set theoretic mathematics around 1870; this is followed by a discussion of the period of expansion and consolidation of the theory up to 1900. Section 3 concludes with a look at the critical period in the decade 1897 to 1908.

1. Emergence

The concept of a set appears deceivingly simple, at least to the trained mathematician, and to such an extent that it becomes difficult to judge and appreciate correctly the contributions of the pioneers. What cost them much effort to produce, and took the mathematical community considerable time to accept, may seem to us rather self-explanatory or even trivial. Three historical misconceptions that are widespread in the literature should be noted at the outset: (1) It is not the case that actual infinity was universally rejected before Cantor. (2) Set-theoretic views did not arise exclusively from analysis, but emerged also in algebra, number theory, and geometry. (3) In fact, the rise of set-theoretic mathematics preceded Cantor's crucial contributions. All of these points shall become clear in what follows.

The notion of a collection is as old as counting, and logical ideas about classes have existed since at least the “tree of Porphyry” (3rd century C.E.). Thus it becomes difficult to sort out the origins of the concept of set. But sets are neither collections in the everyday sense of this word, nor “classes” in the sense of logicians before the mid-19th century. Ernst Zermelo, a crucial figure in our story, said that the theory had historically been “created by Cantor and Dedekind”. This suggests a good pragmatic criterion: one should start from authors who have significantly influenced the conceptions of Cantor, Dedekind, and Zermelo. For the most part, this is the criterion adopted here. Nevertheless, as every rule calls for an exception, the case of Bolzano is important and instructive, even though Bolzano did not significantly influence later writers.

In 19th century German-speaking areas, there were some intellectual tendencies that promoted the acceptance of the actual infinite (e.g., a revival of Leibniz's thought). In spite of Gauss's warning that the infinite can only be a manner of speaking, some minor figures and three major ones (Bolzano, Riemann, Dedekind) preceded Cantor in fully accepting the actual infinite in mathematics. Those three authors were active in promoting a set-theoretic formulation of mathematical ideas, with Dedekind's contribution in a good number of classic writings (1871, 1872, 1876/77, 1888) being of central importance.

Chronologically, Bernard Bolzano was the first, but he exerted almost no influence. The high quality of his work in logic and the foundations of mathematics is well known. A book entitled Paradoxien des Unendlichen was posthumously published in 1851. Here Bolzano argued in detail that a host of paradoxes surrounding infinity are logically harmless, and mounted a forceful defence of actual infinity. He proposed an interesting argument attempting to prove the existence of infinite sets, which bears comparison with Dedekind's later argument (1888). Although he employed complicated distinctions of different kinds of sets or classes, Bolzano recognized clearly the possibility of putting two infinite sets in one-to-one correspondence, as one can easily do, e.g., with the intervals [0, 5] and [0, 12] by the function 5y = 12x. However, Bolzano resisted the conclusion that both sets are “equal with respect to the multiplicity of their parts”. In all likelihood, traditional ideas of measurement were still too powerful in his way of thinking, and thus he missed the discovery of the concept of cardinality.

The case of Bolzano suggests that a liberation from metric concepts (which came with the development of theories of projective geometry and especially of topology) was to have a crucial role in making possible the abstract viewpoint of set theory. Bernhard Riemann proposed visionary ideas about topology, and about basing all of mathematics on the notion of set or “manifold” in the sense of class (Mannigfaltigkeit), in his celebrated inaugural lecture “On the Hypotheses which lie at the Foundations of Geometry” (1854/1868). Also characteristic of Riemann was a great emphasis on conceptual mathematics, particularly visible in his approach to complex analysis (which again went deep into topology). To give but the simplest example, Riemann was an enthusiastic follower of Dirichlet's idea that a function has to be conceived as an arbitrary injective correspondence between numerical values, be it representable by a formula or not; this meant leaving behind the times when a function was defined to be an analytic expression. Through this new style of mathematics, and through his vision of a new role for sets and a full program for developing topology, Riemann was a crucial influence on both Dedekind and Cantor.

The five-year period 1868–1872 saw a mushrooming of set-theoretic proposals in Germany, so much so that we could regard it as the birth of set-theoretic mathematics. Riemann's geometry lecture, delivered in 1854, was published by Dedekind in 1868, jointly with Riemann's paper on trigonometric series (1854/1868b, which presented the Riemann integral). The latter was the starting point for deep work in real analysis, commencing the study of “seriously” discontinuous functions. The young Georg Cantor entered into this area, which led him to the study of point-sets. In 1872 Cantor introduced an operation upon point sets (see below) and soon he was ruminating about the possibility to iterate that operation to infinity and beyond: it was the first glimpse of the transfinite realm.

Meanwhile, another major development had been put forward by Richard Dedekind in 1871. In the context of his work on algebraic number theory, Dedekind introduced an essentially set-theoretic viewpoint, defining fields and ideals of algebraic numbers. These ideas were presented in a very mature form, making use of set operations and of structure-preserving mappings (see a relevant passage in Ferreirós 1999, 92–93; Cantor employed Dedekind's terminology for the operations in his own work on set theory around 1880: op. cit., 204). Considering the ring of integers in a given field of algebraic numbers, Dedekind defined certain subsets called “ideals” and operated on these sets as new objects. This procedure was the key to his general approach to the topic. In other works, he dealt very clearly and precisely with equivalence relations, partition sets, homomorphisms, and automorphisms. Thus, many of the usual set-theoretic procedures of twentieth-century mathematics go back to his work. Several years later (in 1888), Dedekind would publish a presentation of the basic elements of set theory, making only a bit more explicit the operations on sets and mappings he had been using since 1871.

The following year, Dedekind published a paper in which he provided an axiomatic analysis of the structure of the set R of real numbers. He defined it as an ordered field that is also complete (in the sense that all Dedekind-cuts on R correspond to an element in R); completeness in that sense has the Archimedean axiom as a consequence. Cantor too provided a definition of R in 1872, employing Cauchy sequences of rational numbers, which was an elegant simplification of the definition offered by Carl Weierstrass in his lectures. The form of completeness axiom that Weierstrass preferred was Bolzano's principle that a sequence of nested closed intervals in R (a sequence such that [am+1,bm+1] ⊂ [am,bm]) “contains” at least one real number (or, as we would say, has a non-empty intersection).

The Cantor and Dedekind definitions of the real numbers relied implicitly on set theory, and can be seen in retrospect to involve the assumption of a Power Set principle. Both took as given the set of rational numbers, and for the definition of R they relied on a certain totality of infinite sets of rational numbers (either sequences, or Dedekind cuts). With this, too, constructivistic criticism of set theory began to emerge, as Leopold Kronecker started to make objections to such infinitary procedures. Simultaneously, there began a study of the topology of R, in particular in the work of  Weierstrass, Dedekind, and Cantor. The set-theoretic approach was also exploited by Dedekind in his pioneering work on algebraic number theory (and algebraic geometry in 1882), and by several authors in the fields of real analysis and complex analysis.

Cantor's derived sets are of particular interest (for the context of this idea in real analysis, see e.g. Dauben 1979, Hallett 1984, Lavine 1994, Kanamori 1996, Ferreirós 1999). Cantor took as given the “conceptual sphere” of the real numbers, and he considered arbitrary subsets P, which he called ‘point sets’. A real number r is called a limit point of P, when all neighbourhoods of r contain points of P. This can only happen if P is infinite. With that concept, introduced by Weierstrass, the derived set P′ of P can be defined, as Cantor did, to be the set of all the limit points of P. In general P′ may be infinite and have its own limit points. Thus one can iterate the operation and obtain further derived sets P″, P″′… P(n) … It is easy to give examples of a set P that will give rise to non-empty derived sets P(n) for all finite n. (A rather trivial example is P = Q[0,1], the set of rational numbers in the unit interval; in this case P′ = [0,1] = P″.) Thus one can define P(∞) as the intersection of all P(n) for finite n. This was Cantor's first encounter with transfinite iterations.

Then, in late 1873, came a surprising discovery that fully opened the realm of the transfinite. In correspondence with Dedekind (see Ewald 1996, vol. 2), Cantor asked the question whether the infinite sets N of the natural numbers and R of real numbers can be placed in one-to-one correspondence. In reply, Dedekind offered a surprising proof that the set A of all algebraic numbers is denumerable (i.e., there is a one-to-one correspondence with N). A few days later, Cantor was able to prove that the assumption that R is denumerable leads to a contradiction. To this end, he employed the Bolzano-Weierstrass principle of completeness mentioned above. Thus he had shown that there are more elements in R than in N or Q or A, in the precise sense that the cardinality of R is strictly greater than that of N.

2. Consolidation

Set theory was beginning to become an essential ingredient of the new “modern” approach to mathematics. But this viewpoint was contested, and its consolidation took a rather long time. Dedekind's algebraic style only began to find followers in the 1890s; David Hilbert was among them. The soil was better prepared for the modern theories of real functions: Italian, German, French and British mathematicians contributed during the 1880s. And the new foundational views were taken up by Peano and his followers, by Frege to some extent, by Hilbert in the 1890s, and later by Russell.

Meanwhile, Cantor spent the years 1878 to 1885 publishing key works that helped turn set theory into an autonomous branch of mathematics. Let's write A ≡ B in order to express that the two sets A, B can be put in one-to-one correspondence (have the same cardinality). After proving that the irrational numbers can be put in one-to-one correspondence with R, and, surprisingly, that also Rn ≡ R, Cantor conjectured in 1878 that any subset of R would be either denumerable (≡ N) or ≡ R. This is the first and weakest form of the celebrated Continuum Hypothesis. During the following years, Cantor explored the world of point sets, introducing several important topological ideas (e.g., perfect set, closed set, isolated set), and arrived at results such as the Cantor-Bendixson theorem.

A point set P is closed iff its derived set P′ ⊆ P, and perfect iff P = P′. The Cantor-Bendixson theorem then states that a closed point set can be decomposed into two subsets R and S, such that R is denumerable and S is perfect (indeed, S is the ath derived set of P, for a countable ordinal a). Because of this, closed sets are said to have the perfect set property. Furthermore, Cantor was able to prove, in (1884), that perfect sets have the power of the continuum. Both results implied that the Continuum Hypothesis is valid for all closed point sets. Many years later, in 1916, Pavel Aleksandrov and Felix Hausdorff were able to show that the broader class of Borel sets have the perfect set property too.

His work on points sets led Cantor, in 1882, to conceive of the transfinite numbers (see Ferreirós 1999, 267ff). This was a turning point in his research, for from then onward he studied abstract set theory independently of more specific questions having to do with point sets and their topology (until the mid-1880s, these questions had been prominent in his agenda). Subsequently, Cantor focused on the transfinite cardinal and ordinal numbers, and on general order types, independently of the topological properties of R.

The transfinite ordinals were introduced as new numbers in an important mathematico-philosophical paper of 1883, Grundlagen einer allgemeinen Mannichfaltgkeitslehre (notice that Cantor still uses Riemann's term). Cantor defined them by means of two “generating principles”: the first (1) yields the successor a+1 for any given number a, while the second (2) stipulates that there is a number b which follows immediately after any given sequence of numbers without a last element. Thus, after all the finite numbers comes, by (2), the first transfinite number, ω (read: omega); and this is followed by ω+1, ω+2, …, ω+ω = ω·2, …, ω·n, ω·n +1, …,ω2, ω2+1, …, ωω, … and so on and on. Whenever a sequence without last element appears, one can go on and, so to say, jump to a higher stage by (2).

The introduction of these new numbers seemed like idle speculation to most of his contemporaries, but for Cantor they served two very important functions. To this end, he classified the transfinite ordinals as follows: the “first number class” consisted of the finite ordinals, the set N of natural numbers; the “second number class” was formed by ω and all numbers following it (including ωω, and many more) that have only a denumerable set of predecessors. This crucial condition was suggested by the problem of proving the Cantor-Bendixson theorem. On that basis, Cantor could establish the results that the cardinality of the “second number class” is greater than that of N; and that no intermediate cardinality exists. Thus, if you write card(N) = ℵ0 (read: aleph sub zero), his theorems justified calling the cardinality of the “second number class” ℵ1.

After the second number class comes a “third number class” (all transfinite ordinals whose set of predecessors has cardinality ℵ1); the cardinality of this new number class can be proved to be ℵ2. And so on. The first function of the transfinite ordinals was, thus, to establish a well-defined scale of increasing transfinite cardinalities. (The aleph notation used above was introduced by Cantor only in 1895.) This made it possible to formulate much more precisely the problem of the continuum; Cantor's conjecture became the hypothesis that card(R) = ℵ1. Furthermore, relying on the transfinite ordinals, Cantor was able to prove the Cantor-Bendixson theorem, rounding out the results on point sets that he had been elaborating during these crucial years.

The study of the transfinite ordinals directed Cantor's attention towards ordered sets, and in particular well-ordered sets. A set S is well-ordered by a relation < iff < is a total order and every subset of S has a least element in the <-ordering. (The real numbers are not well-ordered in their usual order: just consider an open interval. Meanwhile, N is the simplest infinite well-ordered set.) Cantor argued that the transfinite ordinals truly deserve the name of numbers, because they express the “type of order” of any possible well-ordered set. Notice also that it was easy for Cantor to indicate how to reorder the natural numbers so as to make them correspond to the order types ω+1, ω+2, …, ω·2, …, ω·n, …, ω2, …, ωω, … and so on. (For instance, reordering N in the form: 2, 4, 6, …, 5, 15, 25, 35, …, 1, 3, 7, 9, … we obtain a set that has order type ω·3.)

Notice too that the Continuum Hypothesis, if true, would entail that the set R of real numbers can indeed be well-ordered. Cantor was so committed to this viewpoint, that he presented the further hypothesis that every set can be well-ordered as “a fundamental and momentous law of thought”. Some years later, Hilbert called attention to both the Continuum Hypothesis and the well-ordering problem as Problem 1 in his celebrated list of ‘Mathematische Probleme’ (1900). Doing so was an intelligent way of emphasizing the importance of set theory for the future of mathematics, and the fruitfulness of its new methods and problems.

In 1895 and 1897, Cantor published his last two articles. They were a well-organized presentation of his results on the transfinite numbers (cardinals and ordinals) and their theory, and also on order types and well-ordered sets. However, these papers did not advance significant new ideas. Unfortunately, Cantor had doubts about a third part he had prepared, which would have discussed very important issues having to do with the problem of well-ordering and the paradoxes (see below). Surprisingly, Cantor also failed to include in the 1895/97 papers a theorem which he had published some years before which is known simply as Cantor's Theorem: given any set S, there exists another set whose cardinality is greater (this is the power set p(S), as we now say — Cantor used instead the set of functions f: S → {0, 1}). In the same short paper (1892), Cantor presented his famous proof that R is non-denumerable by the method of diagonalisation, a method which he then extended to prove Cantor's Theorem. (A related form of argument had appeared earlier in the work of P. du Bois-Reymond.)

Meanwhile, other authors were exploring the possibilities opened by set theory for the foundations of mathematics. Most important was Dedekind's contribution (1888) with a deep presentation of the theory of the natural numbers. He formulated some basic principles of set (and mapping) theory; gave axioms for the natural number system; proved that mathematical induction is conclusive and recursive definitions are flawless; developed the basic theory of arithmetic; introduced the finite cardinals; and proved that his axiom system is categorical. His system had four axioms. Given a function φ defined on S, a set N ⊆ S, and a distinguished element 1 ∈ N, they are as follows:

(α) φ(N) ⊂ N
(β) N = φo{1}
(γ) 1 ∉ φ(N)
(δ) the function φ is injective.

Condition (β) is crucial since it ensures minimality for the set of natural numbers, which accounts for the validity of proofs by mathematical induction. N = φo{1} is read: N is the chain of singleton {1} under the function φ, that is, the minimal closure of {1} under the function φ. In general, one considers the chain of a set A under an arbitrary mapping γ, denoted by γo(A); in his booklet Dedekind developed an interesting theory of such chains, which allowed him to prove the Cantor-Bernstein theorem. The theory was later generalized by Zermelo.

In the following years, Giuseppe Peano gave a more superficial (but also more famous) treatment of the natural numbers, employing the new symbolic language of logic, and Gottlob Frege elaborated his own ideas, which however fell prey to the paradoxes. An important book inspired by the set-theoretic style of thinking was Hilbert's Grundlagen der Geometrie (1899), which took the “mathematics of axioms” one step beyond Dedekind through a rich study of geometric systems motivated by questions concerning the independence of his axioms. Hilbert's book made clear the new axiomatic methodology that had been shaping up in connection with the novel methods of set theory, and he combined it with the axiomatic trends coming from projective geometry.

3. Critical Period

In the late nineteenth century, it was a widespread idea that pure mathematics is nothing but an elaborate form of arithmetic. Thus it was usual to talk about the “arithmetisation” of mathematics, and how it had brought about the highest standards of rigor. With Dedekind and Hilbert, this viewpoint led to the idea of grounding all of pure mathematics in set theory. The most difficult steps in bringing forth this viewpoint had been the establishment of a theory of the real numbers, and a set-theoretic reduction of the natural numbers. Both problems had been solved by the work of Cantor and Dedekind. But precisely when mathematicians were celebrating that “full rigor” had been finally attained, serious problems emerged for the foundations of set theory. First Cantor, and then Russell, discovered the paradoxes in set theory.

Cantor was led to the paradoxes by having introduced the “conceptual sphere” of the transfinite numbers. Each transfinite ordinal is the order type of the set of its predecessors; e.g., ω is the order type of {0, 1, 2, 3, …}, and ω+2 is the order type of {0, 1, 2, 3, …, ω, ω+1}. Thus, to each initial segment of the series of ordinals, there corresponds an immediately greater ordinal. Now, the “whole series” of all transfinite ordinals would form a well-ordered set, and to it there would correspond a new ordinal number. This is unacceptable, for this ordinal o would have to be greater than all members of the “whole series”, and in particular o < o. This is usually called the Burali-Forti paradox, or paradox of the ordinals (although Burali-Forti himself failed to formulate it clearly, see Moore & Garciadiego 1981).

Although Cantor might have found that paradox as early as 1883, immediately after introducing the transfinite ordinals (for arguments in favour of this idea see Purkert & Ilgauds 1987 and Tait 2000), the evidence indicates clearly that it was not until 1896/97 that he realized the implications of this paradoxical argument . By this time, he was also able to employ Cantor's Theorem to yield the Cantor paradox, or paradox of the alephs: if there existed a set of all cardinal numbers (alephs), Cantor's Theorem applied to it would give a new aleph ℵ, such that ℵ < ℵ. The great set theorist realized perfectly well that these paradoxes were a fatal blow to the “logical” approaches to sets favoured by Frege and Dedekind. Cantor emphasized that his views were “in diametrical opposition” to Dedekind's, and in particular to his “naïve assumption that all well-defined collections, or systems, are also ‘consistent systems’ ” (see the letter to Hilbert, Nov. 15, 1899, in Purkert & Ilgauds 1987, 154). (Contrary to what has often been claimed, Cantor's ambiguous definition of set in his paper of 1895 was intended to be “diametrically opposite” to the logicists’ understanding of sets – what is often called “naïve” set theory, or can more properly be called the dichotomy conception of sets, following a suggestion of Gödel.)

Cantor thought he could solve the problem of the paradoxes by distinguishing between “consistent multiplicities” or sets, and “inconsistent multiplicities”. But, in the absence of explicit criteria for the distinction, this was simply a verbal answer to the problem. Being aware of deficiencies in his new ideas, Cantor never published a last paper he had been preparing, in which he planned to discuss the paradoxes and the problem of well-ordering (we know quite well the contents of this unpublished paper, as Cantor discussed it in correspondence with Dedekind and Hilbert; see the 1899 letters to Dedekind in Cantor 1932, Ewald 1996, vol. II, or Cantor 2005). Cantor presented an argument that relied on the (“Burali-Forti”) paradox of the ordinals, and aimed to prove that every set can be well-ordered. This argument was later rediscovered by the British mathematician P. E. B. Jourdain, but it is open to criticism because it works with “inconsistent multiplicities”.

Cantor's paradoxes convinced Hilbert and Dedekind that there were important doubts concerning the foundations of set theory. Hilbert formulated a paradox of his own (Peckhaus & Kahle 2002), and discussed the problem with mathematicians in his Göttingen circle. Ernst Zermelo was thus led to discover the paradox of the “set” of all sets that are not members of themselves (Rang & Thomas 1981). This was independently discovered by Bertrand Russell, who was led to it by a careful study of Cantor's Theorem, which conflicted deeply with Russell's belief in a universal set. Some time later, in June 1902, he communicated the “contradiction” to Gottlob Frege, who was completing his own logical foundation of arithmetic, in a well-known letter. Frege's reaction made very clear the profound impact of this contradiction upon the logicist program. “Can I always speak of a class, of the extension of a concept? And if not, how can I know the exceptions?” Faced with this, “I cannot see how arithmetic could be given a scientific foundation, how numbers could be conceived as logical objects” (Frege 1903, 253).

The publication of Volume II of Frege's Grundgesetze, and above all Russell's work The Principles of Mathematics, made the mathematical community fully aware of the existence of the set-theoretic paradoxes, of their impact and importance. There is evidence that, up to then, even Hilbert and Zermelo had not fully appreciated the damage. Notice that the Russell-Zermelo paradox operates with very basic notions – negation and set membership – concepts that had widely been regarded as purely logical. The “set” R = {x: x ∉ x} exists according to the principle of comprehension (which allows any open sentence to determine a class), but if so, R ∈ R iff R ∉ R. It is a direct contradiction to the principle favoured by Frege and Russell.

It was obviously necessary to clarify the foundations of set theory, but the overall situation did not make this an easy task. The different competing viewpoints were widely divergent. Cantor had a metaphysical understanding of set theory and, although he had one of the sharpest views of the field, he could not offer a precise foundation. It was clear to him (as it had been, somewhat mysteriously, to Ernst Schröder in his Vorlesungen über die Algebra der Logik, 1891) that one has to reject the idea of a Universal Set, favoured by Frege and Dedekind. Frege and Russell based their approach on the principle of comprehension, which was shown contradictory. Dedekind avoided that principle, but he postulated that the Absolute Universe was a set, a “thing” in his technical sense of Gedankending; and he coupled that assumption with full acceptance of arbitrary subsets.

This idea of admitting arbitrary subsets had been one of the deep inspirations of both Cantor and Dedekind, but none of them had thematized it. (Here, their modern understanding of analysis played a crucial but implicit background role, since they worked within the Dirichlet-Riemann tradition of “arbitrary” functions.) As for the now famous iterative conception there were some elements of it (particularly in Dedekind's work, with his iterative development of the number system, and his views on “systems” and “things”), but it was conspicuously absent from many of the relevant authors, Cantor included! Typically, Cantor did not iterate the process of set formation: he always tended to consider sets of homogeneous elements, elements which were taken to belong “in some conceptual sphere” (either numbers, or points, or functions, or even physical particles – but never intermingled). The iterative conception was first suggested by Kurt Gödel in 1933, in connection with technical work by von Neumann and Zermelo a few years before. It came only post facto, after very substantial amounts of set theory had been developed and fully systematized.

This variety of conflicting viewpoints contributed much to the overall confusion, but there was more. In addition to the paradoxes discussed above (set-theoretic paradoxes, as we say), the list of “logical” paradoxes included a whole array of further ones (later called “semantic”). Among these are paradoxes due to Russell, Richard, König, Berry, Grelling, etc., as well as the ancient liar paradox due to Epimenides. And the diagnoses and proposed cures for the damage were tremendously varied. Some authors, like Russell, thought it was essential to find a new logical system that could solve all the paradoxes at once. This led him into the ramified type theory that formed the basis of Principia Mathematica (3 volumes, 1910–1913), his joint work with Alfred Whitehead. Other authors, like Zermelo, believed that most of those paradoxes dissolved as soon as one worked within a restricted axiomatic system. They concentrated on the “set-theoretic” paradoxes (as we have done above), and were led to search for axiomatic systems of set theory.

Even more importantly, the questions left open by Cantor and emphasized by Hilbert in his first problem of 1900 caused heated debate. At the International Congress of  Mathematicians at Heidelberg, 1904, Gyula (Julius) König proposed a very detailed proof that the cardinality of the continuum cannot be any of Cantor's alephs. His proof was only flawed because he had relied on a result previously “proven” by Felix Bernstein, a student of Cantor and Hilbert. It took some months for Felix Hausdorff to identify the flaw and correct it (see Hausdorff 2002). Meanwhile, Zermelo was able to present a proof that every set can be well-ordered, using the Axiom of Choice. During the following year, prominent mathematicians in Germany, France, Italy and England discussed the Axiom of Choice and its acceptability.

This started a whole era during which the Axiom of Choice was treated most carefully as a dubious hypothesis (see the monumental study by Moore 1982). And that is ironic, for, among all of the usual principles of set theory, the Axiom of Choice is the only one that explicitly enforces the existence of some arbitrary subsets. But, important as this idea had been in motivating Cantor and Dedekind, infinite arbitrary subsets were rejected by many other authors. Among the most influential ones in the following period, one ought to emphasize the names of Russell and Hermann Weyl.

The impressive polemics which surrounded his Well-Ordering Theorem, and the most interesting and difficult problem posed by the foundations of mathematics, led Zermelo to concentrate on axiomatic set theory. As a result of his incisive analysis, in 1908 he published his axiom system, showing how it blocked the known paradoxes and yet allowed for a masterful development of the theory of cardinals (and ordinals). This, however, is the topic of another entry.

4. Concluding Remarks

In the period 1900-1930, the rubric “set theory” was still understood to include topics in topology and the theory of functions. Although Cantor, Dedekind, and Zermelo had left that stage behind to concentrate on abstract set theory, for mathematicians at large this would still take some time. At the first International Congress of Mathematicians, 1897, keynote speeches given by Hadamard and Hurwitz defended the importance of set theory in connection with analysis. Around 1900, motivated by analysis, important work was done by three French analysts: Borel, Baire and Lebesgue. In retrospect, their work inaugurated the development of descriptive set theory by extending Cantor's studies on definable sets of real numbers. They introduced the hierarchy of Borel sets, the Baire hierarchy of functions, and the concept of Lebesgue measure.

This suggested the possibility of proving the Continuum Hypothesis (CH) by descriptive set-theoretic research. Soon, however, it was shown using the Axiom of Choice that there are non-Lebesgue measurable sets of reals (Vitali, 1905), and also uncountable sets of reals with no perfect subset (Bernstein, 1908). Such results made clear the impossibility of reaching the goal of CH by concentrating on definable sets of reals.

Cantor's other main legacy, the study of transfinite numbers, was developed further by Hausdorff and Mahlo. By 1908 Hausdorff was working on uncountable order types and introduced the Generalized Continuum Hypothesis (2ℵa = ℵa+1); he was also the first to consider the possibility of an “exorbitant” cardinal (weakly inaccessible). Few years later, in the early 1910s, Paul Mahlo was studying hierarchies of such large cardinals in work that pioneered what was to become a central area of set theory. Hausdorff's textbook Grundzüge der Mengenlehre (1914; see his 2002) introduced two generations of mathematicians into set theory and general topology.

Meanwhile, set-theoretic mathematics continued its development into the powerful axiomatic and structural approach that was to dominate much of the 20th century. To give a couple of examples, Ernst Steinitz published in 1910 his research on abstract field theory, making essential use of the Axiom of Choice; and the study of function spaces began with work by Hilbert, Maurice Fréchet, and others. During the 1920s and 30s, abstract topology became an independent branch of study, and structural algebra came of age. Ever since, “set theory” has generally been identified with the branch of mathematical logic that studies transfinite sets, originating in Cantor's result that R has a greater cardinality than N. But, as the foregoing discussion shows, set theory was both effect and cause of the rise of modern mathematics: the traces of this origin are indelibly stamped on its axiomatic structure.

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Continuum Hypothesis, The | Frege, Gottlob | paradoxes: and contemporary logic | Russell, Bertrand | Russell's paradox | set theory | set theory: development of axiomatic | Whitehead, Alfred North