The Combination Argument

Both Bertrand Russell and G. E. Moore came to hold that the only states of affairs that there are are facts -- states of affairs that obtain. Various passages in their writings suggest an argument for this conclusion, based on the compositionalist conception of states of affairs. For example:

We are not now hearing the noise of a brass-band; and we all, I think, can understand the nature of the fact which I express by saying we are not. What these words imply is that there simply is no such thing in the Universe as our being now hearing that particular kind of noise. The combination of us at this moment with hearing of that particular kind of noise is a combination which simply has no being. There is no such combination. (Moore 1966, pp. 277-278)

We can call this the "combination argument" (Wetzel 1998). If we consider (1)

(1) this wall's being dark green

this state of affairs would simply consist of this wall exhibiting the color dark green, on the compositionalist view. For there to be such an entity, this connection must hold between the wall the color since the state of affairs simply is the connecting of the wall to the color dark green.

In arguing for states of affairs, Gustav Bergmann (Bergmann 1964) and D. M. Armstrong (Armstrong 1997) appeal to an argument of the following sort:

The constituents of (1) are, let us say, the wall surface and the color dark green. How is (1) differentiated from the mere collection of these constituents {this wall, being dark green}, or the mereological sum of those constituents, this wall+being dark green? Presumably the constituents might exist even if they were not so connected. But if the constituents of (1) could exist even if (1) did not, then (1) cannot be reduced to simply the collection or mereological sum of its constituents.

The combination argument shows that this conclusion is inconsistent with the existence of possible but non-obtaining states of affairs, as follows:

(B1) For a basic state of affairs of the form a's-having-F, a's-having-F exists when and only when exemplification connects a to F.

(B2) If a is connected by exemplification to F, then a's-having-F obtains.

(B3) Hence, a's-having-F exists only if it obtains.

(B4) Since this could be generalized to other ties connecting constituents to form states of affairs, there are no non-obtaining states of affairs.

The combination argument assumes that exemplification is the connection that accounts for the unity (and thus existence) of a basic state of affairs of the form a's-having-F. The argument also assumes that exemplification is the connection that accounts for the obtaining of a basic state of affairs of the form a's-having-F. Clearly, the soft actualist cannot agree with both assumptions.

At this point a soft actualist compositionalist might appeal to the following distinction. Let us say that the connection among the constituents of a state of affairs that accounts for the existence of that state of affairs is the constitutive connection for that state of affairs. And let us say that the connection among the constituents of a state of affairs that accounts for the obtaining of a state of affairs is the actualization connection for that state of affairs. In the Tractatus Logico-philosophicus Wittgenstein says: "Form is the possibility of structure." (Wittgenstein 1961, p. 13) Wittgenstein appears to be differentiating the constitutive and actualization connections of states of affairs. The "structure" (such as exemplification) is the actualization connection. The possibility of such structure being realized is the constitutive connection. The possibility of this wall surface being dark green is the constitutive connection that is necessary and sufficient for the existence of (1), on this view. Thus, a soft actualist who views states of affairs as compositional can use this distinction to escape the conclusion that there are no non-obtaining states of affairs. Exemplification must hold between the constituents of a's-having-F for this state of affairs to obtain, but a different tie accounts for the existence of that state of affairs. Soft actualism thus requires two primitives where hard actualism can get by with one.

[Return to States of Affairs.]