Maurice Merleau-Ponty

First published Wed Sep 14, 2016

[Editor's Note: The following new entry by Ted Toadvine replaces the former entry on this topic by the previous author.]

Maurice Jean Jacques Merleau-Ponty (1908–1961), French philosopher and public intellectual, was the leading academic proponent of existentialism and phenomenology in post-war France. Best known for his original and influential work on embodiment, perception, and ontology, he also made important contributions to the philosophy of art, history, language, nature, and politics. Associated in his early years with the existentialist movement through his friendship with Jean-Paul Sartre and Simone de Beauvoir, Merleau-Ponty played a central role in the dissemination of phenomenology, which he sought to integrate with Gestalt psychology, psychoanalysis, Marxism, and Saussurian linguistics. Major influences on his thinking include Henri Bergson, Edmund Husserl, Martin Heidegger, Max Scheler, and Jean-Paul Sartre, as well as neurologist Kurt Goldstein, Gestalt theorists such as Wolfgang Köhler and Kurt Koffka, and literary figures including Marcel Proust, Paul Claudel, and Paul Valéry. In turn, he influenced the post-structuralist generation of French thinkers who succeeded him, including Michel Foucault, Gilles Deleuze, and Jacques Derrida, whose similarities with and debt to the later Merleau-Ponty have often been underestimated. Merleau-Ponty published two major theoretical texts during his lifetime: The Structure of Behavior (1942 SC) and Phenomenology of Perception (1945 PP). Other important publications include two volumes of political philosophy, Humanism and Terror (1947 HT) and Adventures of the Dialectic (1955 AdD), as well as two books of collected essays on art, philosophy, and politics: Sense and Non-Sense ([1948]1996b/1964) and Signs (1960/1964). Two unfinished manuscripts appeared posthumously: The Prose of the World (1969/1973), drafted in 1950–51; and The Visible and the Invisible (1964 V&I), on which he was working at the time of his death. Lecture notes and student transcriptions of many of his courses at the Sorbonne and the Collège de France have also been published.

For most of his career, Merleau-Ponty focused on the problems of perception and embodiment as a starting point for clarifying the relation between the mind and the body, the objective world and the experienced world, expression in language and art, history, politics, and nature. Although phenomenology provided the overarching framework for these investigations, Merleau-Ponty also drew freely on empirical research in psychology and ethology, anthropology, psychoanalysis, linguistics, and the arts. His constant points of historical reference are Descartes, Kant, Hegel, and Marx. The characteristic approach of Merleau-Ponty’s theoretical work is his effort to identify an alternative to intellectualism or idealism, on the one hand, and empiricism or realism, on the other, by critiquing their common presupposition of a ready-made world and failure to account for the historical and embodied character of experience. In his later writings, Merleau-Ponty becomes increasingly critical of the intellectualist tendencies of the phenomenological method as well, although with the intention of reforming rather than abandoning it. The posthumous writings collected in The Visible and the Invisible aim to clarify the ontological implications of a phenomenology that would self-critically account for its own limitations. This leads him to propose concepts such as “flesh” and “chiasm” that many consider to be his most fruitful philosophical contributions.

Merleau-Ponty’s thought has continued to inspire contemporary research beyond the usual intellectual history and interpretive scholarship, especially in the areas of feminist philosophy, philosophy of mind and cognitive science, environmental philosophy and philosophy of nature, political philosophy, philosophy of art, philosophy of language, and phenomenological ontology. His work has also been widely influential on researchers outside the discipline of philosophy proper, especially in anthropology, architecture, the arts, cognitive science, environmental theory, film studies, linguistics, literature, and political theory.

1. Life and Works

Merleau-Ponty was born in Rochefort-sur-Mer, in the province of Charente-Maritime, on March 14, 1908.[1] After the death in 1913 of his father, a colonial artillery captain and a knight of the Legion of Honor, he moved with his family to Paris. He would later describe his childhood as incomparably happy, and he remained very close to his mother until her death in 1953. Merleau-Ponty pursued secondary studies at the Parisian lycees Janson-de-Sailly and Louis-le-Grand, completing his first course in philosophy at Janson-de-Sailly with Gustave Rodrigues in 1923–24. He won the school’s “Award for Outstanding Achievement” in philosophy that year and would later trace his commitment to the vocation of philosophy to this first course. He was also awarded “First Prize in Philosophy” at Louis-le-Grand in 1924–25. He attended the École Normale Supérieure from 1926 to 1930, where he befriended Simone de Beauvoir and Claude Lévi-Straus. Some evidence suggests that, during these years, Merleau-Ponty authored a novel, Nord. Récit de l’arctique, under the pseudonym Jacques Heller (Alloa 2013b). His professors at ENS included Léon Brunschvicg and Émile Bréhier, the latter supervising his research on Plotinus for the Diplôme d’études supérieures in 1929. Bréhier would continue to supervise Merleau-Ponty’s research through the completion of his two doctoral dissertations in 1945. During his student years, Merleau-Ponty attended Husserl’s 1929 Sorbonne lectures and Georges Gurvitch’s 1928–1930 courses on German philosophy. He received the agrégation in philosophy in 1930, ranking in second place.

After a year of mandatory military service, Merleau-Ponty taught at the lycee in Beauvais from 1931 to 1933, pursued a year of research on perception funded by a subvention from the Caisse nationale des sciences (the precursor of today’s Centre national de la recherche scientifique) in 1933–34, and taught at the lycee in Chartres in 1934–35. From 1935 to 1940, he was a tutor (agégé-répétiteur) at the École Normale Supérieure, where his primary duty was to prepare students for the agrégation. During this period, he attended Alexandre Kojève’s lectures on Hegel and Aron Gurwitsch’s lectures on Gestalt psychology. His first publications also appeared during these years, as a series of review essays on Max Scheler’s Ressentiment (1935), Gabriel Marcel’s Being and Having (1936), and Sartre’s Imagination (1936).[2] In 1938, he completed his thèse complémentaire, originally titled Conscience et comportement [Consciousness and Behavior] and published in 1942 as La structure du comportement [The Structure of Behavior, SC]. He was the first outside visitor to the newly established Husserl Archives in Louvain, Belgium, in April 1939, where he met Eugen Fink and consulted Husserl’s unpublished manuscripts, including Ideen II and later sections of Die Krisis.

With the outbreak of World War Two, Merleau-Ponty served for a year as lieutenant in the 5th Infantry Regiment and 59th Light Infantry Division, until he was wounded in battle in June 1940, days before the signing of the armistice between France and Germany. He was awarded the Croix de guerre, recognizing bravery in combat. After several months of convalescence, he returned to teaching at the Lycée Carnot in Paris, where he remained from 1940 until 1944. In November 1940, he married Suzanne Jolibois, and their daughter Marianne was born in June 1941. In the winter of 1940–41, Merleau-Ponty renewed his acquaintance with Jean-Paul Sartre, whom he had met as a student at the École Normale, through their involvement in the resistance group Socialisme et Liberté. The group published around ten issues of an underground review until the arrest of two members in early 1942 led to its dissolution. After the conclusion of the war, in 1945, Merleau-Ponty would collaborate with Sartre and Beauvoir to found Les Temps Modernes, a journal devoted to “littérature engagée”, for which he served as political editor until 1952.

At the end of the 1943–44 school year, Merleau-Ponty completed his main thesis, Phénoménologie de la perception [Phenomenology of Perception, PP], and in 1944–45 he taught at the Lycée Condorcet in Paris, replacing Sartre during the latter’s leave from this position. Merleau-Ponty defended his two dissertations in July 1945, fulfilling the requirements for the Docteur ès lettres, which was awarded “with distinction”. In October 1945, Les Temps Modernes published its inaugural issue; Merleau-Ponty was a founding member of the journal’s governing board, managed its daily affairs, and penned many of its editorials that were signed simply “T.M.”, even though he refused to allow his name to be printed on the cover alongside Sartre’s as the review’s Director. That fall, Merleau-Ponty was appointed to the post of Maître de conférences in Psychology at the University of Lyon, where he was promoted to the rank of Professor in the Chair of Psychology in 1948. From 1947 to 1949, he also taught supplementary courses at the École Normale Supérieure, where his students included the young Michel Foucault. Student notes (taken by Jean Deprun) from Merleau-Ponty’s 1947–48 course on “The Union of the Soul and the Body in Malebranche, Biran, and Bergson”—a course that he taught at both Lyon and E.N.S. to prepare students for the agrégation and which was attended by Foucault—were published in 1968 (1997b/2001).

In 1947, Merleau-Ponty participated regularly in the Collège philosophique, an association formed by Jean Wahl to provide an open venue for intellectual exchange without the academic formality of the Sorbonne, and frequented by many leading Parisian thinkers. Merleau-Ponty published his first book of political philosophy in 1947, Humanisme et terreur, essai sur le problème communiste [Humanism and Terror: An Essay on the Communist Problem, 1969, HT], in which he responded to the developing opposition between liberal democracies and communism by cautioning a “wait-and-see” attitude toward Marxism. A collection of essays concerning the arts, philosophy, and politics, Sens et non-sense [Sense and Non-Sense, 1996b/1964], appeared in 1948. In the fall of 1948, Merleau-Ponty delivered a series of seven weekly lectures on French national radio that were subsequently published as Causeries 1948 (2002/2004).

Merleau-Ponty declined an invitation to join the Department of Philosophy at the University of Chicago as a Visiting Professor in 1948–49, but instead received a leave from Lyon for the year to present a series of lectures at the University of Mexico in early 1949. Later in 1949, Merleau-Ponty was appointed Professor of Child Psychology and Pedagogy at the University of Paris, and in this position lectured widely on child development, psychoanalysis, phenomenology, Gestalt psychology, and anthropology. His eight courses from the Sorbonne are known from compiled student notes reviewed by him and published in the Sorbonne’s Bulletin de psychologie (1988/2010). Merleau-Ponty held this position for three years until his election, in 1952, to the Chair of Philosophy at the Collège de France, the most prestigious post for a philosopher in France, which he would hold until his death in 1961. At forty-four, Merleau-Ponty was the youngest person ever elected to this position, but his appointment was not without controversy. Rather than following the typical procedure of ratifying the vote of the General Assembly of Professors, who had selected Merleau-Ponty as their lead candidate, the Académie des sciences morales et politiques made the unprecedented decision to remove his name from the list of candidates; the Académie’s decision was subsequently overturned by the Minister of Education himself, who allowed the faculty vote in favor of Merleau-Ponty to stand. Merleau-Ponty’s January 1953 inaugural lecture at the Collège de France was published under the title Éloge de la Philosophie [In Praise of Philosophy, 1953/1963]. Many of his courses from the Collège de France have subsequently been published, based either on student notes or Merleau-Ponty’s own lecture notes (1964b, 1968/1970, 1995/2003, 1996a, 1998/2002, 2003/2010, 2011, 2013).

In the face of growing political disagreements with Sartre set in motion by the Korean War, Merleau-Ponty resigned his role as political editor of Les Temps Modernes in December of 1952 and withdrew from the editorial board altogether in 1953. His critique of Sartre’s politics became public in 1955 with Les Aventures de la dialectique [Adventures of the Dialectic, 1973 AdD], in which Merleau-Ponty distanced himself from revolutionary Marxism and sharply criticized Sartre for “ultrabolshevism”. Beauvoir’s equally biting rebuttal, “Merleau-Ponty and Pseudo-Sartreanism”, published the same year in Les Temps Modernes, accuses Merleau-Ponty of willfully misrepresenting Sartre’s position, opening a rift between the three former friends that would never entirely heal. Merleau-Ponty’s intellectual circle during his years at the Collège de France included Lévi-Straus and Jacques Lacan, and for several years he was a regular contributor to the popular weekly magazine L’Express. In October and November 1955, on a commission from Alliance française, Merleau-Ponty visited several African countries, including Tunisia, French Equatorial Africa, the Belgian Congo, and Kenya, where he delivered a series of lectures on the concept of race, colonialism, and development. In 1956, he published Les Philosophes célèbres [Famous Philosophers], a large edited volume of original introductions to key historical and contemporary thinkers (beginning, interestingly, with philosophers from India and China) whose contributors included Gilles Deleuze, Gilbert Ryle, Alfred Schutz, and Jean Starobinski. In April 1957, Merleau-Ponty declined to accept induction into France’s Order of the Legion of Honor, presumably in protest over the inhumane actions of the Fourth Republic, including the use of torture, during the Battle of Algiers. In October and November of 1957, as his second commission from Alliance française, he lectured in Madagascar, Reunion Island, and Mauritius, citing as a primary motivation for accepting the commission his desire to see first-hand the effects of reforms in French policies governing overseas territories. The last book Merleau-Ponty published during his lifetime, Signes [Signs, 1960/1964], appearing in 1960, collecting essays on art, language, the history of philosophy, and politics that spanned more than a decade. His last published essay, “L’Œil et l’esprit” [“Eye and Mind”, 1964a OEE] addressing the ontological implications of painting, appeared in the 1961 inaugural issue of Art de France. Merleau-Ponty died of a heart attack in Paris on May 3rd, 1961, at the age of 53, with Descartes’ Optics open on his desk.

Merleau-Ponty’s friend and former student Claude Lefort published two of his teacher’s unfinished manuscripts posthumously: La prose du monde [The Prose of the World, 1969/1973], an exploration of literature and expression drafted in 1950–51 and apparently abandoned; and Le visible et l’invisible [The Visible and the Invisible, 1968 V&I], a manuscript and numerous working notes from 1959–1961 that present elements of Merleau-Ponty’s mature ontology. The latter manuscript was apparently part of a larger project, Être et Monde [Being and World], for which two additional unpublished sections were substantially drafted in 1957–1958: La Nature ou le monde du silence [Nature or the World of Silence] and Introduction à l’ontologie [Introduction to Ontology] (Saint Aubert 2013: 28).[3] These manuscripts, along with many of Merleau-Ponty’s other unpublished notes and papers, were donated to the Bibliothèque Nationale de France by Suzanne Merleau-Ponty in 1992 and are available for consultation by scholars.[4]

2. The Nature of Perception and The Structure of Behavior

Merleau-Ponty’s lifelong interest in the philosophical status of perception is already reflected in his successful 1933 application for a subvention to study the nature of perception, where he proposes to synthesize recent findings in experimental psychology (especially Gestalt psychology) and neurology to develop an alternative to dominant intellectualist accounts of perception inspired by critical (Kantian) philosophy. Interestingly, this early proposal emphasizes the significance of the perception of one’s own body for distinguishing between the “universe of perception” and its intellectual reconstructions, and it gestures toward the “realist philosophers of England and America” (presumably William James and A. N. Whitehead, as presented in Jean Wahl’s 1932 Vers le concret) for their insights into the irreducibility of the sensory and the concrete to intellectual relations. While this initial proposal makes no mention of phenomenology, Merleau-Ponty’s subsequent 1934 report on the year’s research, noting the limitations of approaching the philosophical study of perception through empirical research alone, emphasizes the promise of Husserlian phenomenology for providing a distinctively philosophical framework for the investigation of psychology. In particular, Merleau-Ponty mentions the distinction between the natural and transcendental attitudes and the intentionality of consciousness as valuable for “revising the very notions of consciousness and sensation” (NP: 192/78). He also cites approvingly Aron Gurwitsch’s claim that Husserl’s analyses “lead to the threshold of Gestaltpsychologie”, the second area of focus in this early study. The Gestalt is “a spontaneous organization of the sensory field” in which there are “only organizations, more or less stable, more or less articulated” (NP: 193/79). Merleau-Ponty’s brief summary of Gestalt psychology, anticipating research presented in his first two books, emphasizes the figure-ground structure of perception, the phenomena of depth and movement, and the syncretic perception of children. Nevertheless, Merleau-Ponty concludes—again citing Gurwitsch—that the epistemological framework of Gestalt psychology remains Kantian, requiring that one look “in a very different direction, for a very different solution” to the problem of the relation between the world described naturalistically and the world as perceived (NP: 198/82).

Merleau-Ponty’s first book, The Structure of Behavior (SC), resumes the project of synthesizing and reworking the insights of Gestalt theory and phenomenology to propose an original understanding of the relationship between “consciousness” and “nature”. Whereas the neo-Kantian idealism then dominant in France (e.g., Léon Brunschvicg, Jules Lachelier) treated nature as an objective unity dependent on the synthetic activity of consciousness, the realism of the natural sciences and empirical psychology assumed nature to be composed of external things and events interacting causally. Merleau-Ponty argues that neither approach is tenable: organic life and human consciousness are emergent from a natural world that is not reducible to its meaning for a mind; yet this natural world is not the causal nexus of pre-existing objective realities, since it is fundamentally composed of nested Gestalts, spontaneously emerging structures of organization at multiple levels and degrees of integration. On the one hand, the idealist critique of naturalism should be extended to the naturalistic assumptions framing Gestalt theory. On the other hand, there is a justified truth in naturalism that limits the idealist universalization of consciousness, and this is discovered when Gestalt structures are recognized to be ontologically basic and the limitations of consciousness are thereby exposed. The notion of “behavior”, taken by Merleau-Ponty as parallel to the phenomenological concept of “experience” (in explicit contrast with the American school of behaviorism), is a privileged starting point for the analysis thanks to its neutrality with respect to classical distinctions between the “mental” and the “physiological” (SC: 2/4).

The Structure of Behavior first critiques traditional reflex accounts of the relation between stimulus and reaction in light of the findings of Kurt Goldstein and other contemporary physiologists, arguing that the organism is not passive but imposes its own conditions between the given stimulus and the expected response, so that behavior remains inexplicable in purely anatomical or atomistic terms. Merleau-Ponty instead describes the nervous system as a “field of forces” apportioned according to “modes of preferred distribution”, a model inspired by Wolfgang Köhler’s Gestalt physics (SC: 48/46). Both physiology and behavior are “forms”, that is,

total processes whose properties are not the sum of those which the isolated parts would possess…. [T]here is form wherever the properties of a system are modified by every change brought about in a single one of its parts and, on the contrary, are conserved when they all change while maintaining the same relationship among themselves. (SC: 49–50/47)

Form or structure therefore describes dialectical, non-linear, and dynamic relationships that can function relatively autonomously and are irreducible to linear mechanical causality (see Thompson 2007).

The critique of physiological atomism is also extended to theories of higher behavior, such as Pavlov’s theory of conditioned reflexes. Merleau-Ponty argues that such accounts rely on gratuitous hypotheses lacking experimental justification and cannot effectively explain brain function or learning. In the case of brain function, experimental work on brain damage demonstrates that localization hypotheses must be rejected in favor of a global process of neural organization comparable to the figure-ground structures of perceptual organization. Similarly, learning cannot be explained in terms of trial-and-error fixing of habitual reactions, but instead involves a general aptitude with respect to typical structures of situations. Merleau-Ponty proposes an alternative tripartite classification of behavior according to the degree to which the structures toward which it is oriented emerge thematically from their content. Syncretic behaviors, typical of simpler organisms such as ants or toads, respond to all stimuli as analogues of vital situations for which the organism’s responses are instinctually prescribed by its “species a priori”, with no possibility for adaptive learning or improvisation. Amovable behaviors are oriented toward signals of varying complexity that are not a function of the organism’s instinctual equipment and can lead to genuine learning. Here the organism, guided by its vital norms, responds to signals as relational structures rather than as objective properties of things. Drawing on Köhler’s experimental work with chimpanzees, Merleau-Ponty argues that even intelligent non-human animals lack an orientation toward objective things, which emerges only at the level of symbolic behavior. While amovable behavior remains attached to immediate functional structures, symbolic behavior (here limited to humans) is open to virtual, expressive, and recursive relationships across structures, making possible the human orientation toward objectivity, truth, creativity, and freedom from biologically determined norms.

More generally, Merleau-Ponty proposes that matter, life, and mind are increasingly integrative levels of Gestalt structure, ontologically continuous but structurally discontinuous, and distinguished by the characteristic properties emergent at each integrative level of complexity. A form is defined here as

a field of forces characterized by a law which has no meaning outside the limits of the dynamic structure considered, and which on the other hand assigns its properties to each internal point so much so that they will never be absolute properties, properties of this point. (SC: 148/137–38)

Merleau-Ponty argues that this understanding extends to all physical laws, which “express a structure and have meaning only within this structure”; the laws of physics always refer back to “a sensible or historical given” and ultimately to the history of the universe (SC: 149/138, 157/145). At the level of life, form is characterized by a dialectical relation between the organism and its environment that is a function of the organism’s vital norms, its “optimal conditions of activity and its proper manner of realizing equilibrium”, which express its style or “general attitude toward the world” (SC: 161/148). Living things are not oriented toward an objective world but toward an environment that is organized meaningfully in terms of their individual and specific style and vital goals.

Mind, the symbolic level of form that Merleau-Ponty identifies with the human, is organized not toward vital goals but by the characteristic structures of the human world: tools, language, culture, and so on. These are not originally encountered as things or ideas, but rather as “significative intentions” embodied within the world. Mind or consciousness cannot be defined formally in terms of self-knowledge or representation, then, but is essentially engaged in the structures and actions of the human world and encompasses all of the diverse intentional orientations of human life. While mind integrates within itself the subordinate structures of matter and life, it goes beyond these in its thematic orientation toward structures as such, which is the condition for such characteristically human symbolic activities as language and expression, the creation of new structures beyond those set by vital needs, and the power of choosing and varying points of view (which make truth and objectivity possible). In short, mind as a second-order or recursive structure is oriented toward the virtual rather than simply toward the real. Ideally, the subordinate structure of life would be fully absorbed into the higher order of mind in a fully integrated human being; the biological would be transcended by the “spiritual”. But integration is never perfect or complete, and mind can never be detached from its moorings in a concrete and embodied situation.

Merleau-Ponty emphasizes throughout The Structure of Behavior that form, even though ontologically fundamental, cannot be accounted for in the terms of traditional realism; since form is fundamentally perceptual, an “immanent signification”, it retains an essential relationship with consciousness. But the “perceptual consciousness” at stake here is not the transcendental consciousness of critical philosophy. The last chapter of The Structure of Behavior clarifies this revised understanding of consciousness in dialogue with the classical problem of the relation between the soul and the body in order to account for the relative truths of both transcendental philosophy and naturalism. The issue concerns how to reconcile the perspective of consciousness as “universal milieu” (i.e., transcendental consciousness) with consciousness as “enrooted in the subordinated dialectics”, that is, as a Gestalt emerging from lower-order Gestalts (i.e., perceptual consciousness) (SC: 199/184). In the natural attitude of our pre-reflective lives, we are committed to the view that our perceptual experience of things is always situated and perspectival (i.e., that physical objects are presented through “profiles”, Husserl’s Abschattungen), but also that we thereby experience things “in themselves”, as they really are in the mind-independent world; the perspectival character of our opening onto the world is not a limitation of our access but rather the very condition of the world’s disclosure in its inexhaustibility. At the level of this prereflective faith in the world, there is no dilemma of the soul’s separation from the body; “the soul remains coextensive with nature” (SC: 203/189).

This prereflective unity eventually splinters under our awareness of illness, illusion, and anatomy, which teach us to separate nature, body, and thought into distinct orders of events partes extra partes. This culminates in a naturalism that cannot account for the originary situation of perception that it displaces, yet on which it tacitly relies; perception requires an “internal” analysis, paving the way for transcendental idealism’s treatment of subject and object as “inseparable correlatives” (SC: 215/199). But transcendental idealism in the critical tradition subsequently goes too far: by taking consciousness as “milieu of the universe, presupposed by every affirmation of the world”, it obscures the original character of the perceptual relation and culminates in “the dialectic of the epistemological subject and the scientific object” (SC: 216/200, 217/201). Merleau-Ponty aims to integrate the truth of naturalism and transcendental thought by reinterpreting both through the concept of structure, which accounts for the unity of soul and body as well as their relative distinction. Against the conception of transcendental consciousness as a pure spectator correlated with the world, Merleau-Ponty insists that mind is an accomplishment of structural integration that remains essentially conditioned by the matter and life in which it is embodied; the truth of naturalism lies in the fact that such integration is essentially fragile and incomplete. Since “integration is never absolute and always fails”, the dualism of mind and body

is not a simple fact; it is founded in principle—all integration presupposing the normal functioning of subordinated formations, which always demand their own due. (SC: 226–27/210)

The Structure of Behavior concludes with a call for further investigation of “perceptual consciousness”, a task taken up by its sequel, Phenomenology of Perception. In the concluding pages of Structure, Merleau-Ponty offers a preliminary sketch of phenomenologically inspired approaches to the “problem of perception” that set the stage for his subsequent work, emphasizing (a) the difference between what is directly given as an aspect of individual lived experience and intersubjective significations that are only encountered virtually; and (b) the distinctiveness of one’s own body, which is never experienced directly as one objective thing among many. The book concludes by identifying the “problem of perception” as its encompassing concern:

Can one conceptualize perceptual consciousness without eliminating it as an original mode; can one maintain its specificity without rendering inconceivable its relation to intellectual consciousness? (SC: 241/224)

The solution requires a “return to perception as to a type of originary experience” by means of an “inversion of the natural movement of consciousness”, an inversion that Merleau-Ponty here equates with Husserl’s phenomenological reduction (SC: 236/220). If successful, this rehabilitation of the status of perception would lead to a redefinition of transcendental philosophy “in such a way as to integrate with it the very phenomenon of the real” (SC: 241/224).

3. Phenomenology of Perception

Completed in 1944 and published the following year, Phenomenology of Perception (PP) is the work for which Merleau-Ponty was best known during his lifetime and that established him as the leading French phenomenologist of his generation. Here Merleau-Ponty develops his own distinctive interpretation of phenomenology’s method, informed by his new familiarity with Husserl’s unpublished manuscripts and his deepened engagement with other thinkers in this tradition, such as Eugen Fink and Martin Heidegger. Phenomenology of Perception again draws extensively on Gestalt theory and contemporary research in psychology and neurology; the case of Schneider, a brain-damaged patient studied by Adhémar Gelb and Kurt Goldstein, serves as an extended case-study. Psychological research complements and, at times, serves as a counterpoint to phenomenological descriptions of perceptual experience across a wide range of existential dimensions, including sexuality, language, space, nature, intersubjectivity, time, and freedom. In Phenomenology, Merleau-Ponty develops a characteristic rhythm of presenting, first, the realist or empiricist approach to a particular dimension of experience, followed then by its idealist or intellectualist alternative, before developing a third way that avoids the problematic assumption common to both, namely, their “unquestioned belief in the world”: the prejudice that the objective world exists as a ready-made and fully present reality.

Phenomenology of Perception introduces its inquiry with a critique of the “classical prejudices” of empiricism and intellectualism. Merleau-Ponty rejects the empiricist understanding of sensation, with its correlative “constancy hypothesis”, and the role empiricism grants to association and the projection of memory for treating the basic units of sensation as determinate atoms rather than as meaningful wholes. These wholes include ambiguities, indeterminacies, and contextual relations that defy explanation in terms of the causal action of determinate things. Intellectualism aims to provide an alternative to empiricism by introducing judgment or attention as mental activities that synthesize experience from the sensory givens, yet it adopts empiricism’s starting point in dispersed, atomic sensations. Both approaches are guilty of reading the results of perception (the objective world) back into perceptual experience, thereby falsifying perception’s characteristic structure: the spontaneous organization or configuration of perceived phenomena themselves, with their indeterminacies and ambiguities, and the dynamic character of perception as an historical process involving development and transformation. By treating perception as a causal process of transmission or a cognitive judgment, empiricism and intellectualism deny any meaningful configuration to the perceived as such and treat all values and meanings as projections, leaving no basis in perception itself for distinguishing the true from the illusory.

In contrast, Merleau-Ponty argues that the basic level of perceptual experience is the gestalt, the meaningful whole of figure against ground, and that the indeterminate and contextual aspects of the perceived world are positive phenomenon that cannot be eliminated from a complete account. Sensing, in contrast with knowing, is a “living communication with the world that makes it present to us as the familiar place of our life” (PP: 79/53), investing the perceived world with meanings and values that refer essentially to our bodies and lives. We forget this “phenomenal field”, the world as it appears directly to perception, as a consequence of perception’s own tendency to forget itself in favor of the perceived that it discloses. Perception orients itself toward the truth, placing its faith in the eventual convergence of perspectives and progressive determination of what was previously indeterminate. But it thereby naturally projects a completed and invariant “truth in itself” as its goal. Science extends and amplified this natural tendency through increasingly precise measurements of the invariants in perception, leading eventually to the theoretical construction of an objective world of determinate things. Once this determinism of the “in itself” is extended universally and applied even to the body and the perceptual relation itself, then its ongoing dependence on the “originary faith” of perception is obscured; perception is reduced to “confused appearances” that require methodical reinterpretation, and the eventual result is dualism, solipsism, and skepticism. The “fundamental philosophical act” would therefore be to “return to the lived world beneath the objective world” (PP: 83/57). This requires a transcendental reduction: a reversal of perception’s natural tendency to cover its own tracks and a bracketing of our unquestioned belief in the objective world. Yet this cannot be a recourse to any transcendental consciousness that looks on the world from outside and is not itself emergent from and conditioned by the phenomenal field. Rather than a transcendental ego, Merleau-Ponty speaks of a “transcendental field”, emphasizing that reflection always has a situated and partial perspective as a consequence of being located within the field on which it reflects.

The first of the three major parts of Phenomenology concerns the body. As we have seen, perception transcends itself toward a determinate object “in itself”, culminating in an objective interpretation of the body. Part One shows the limits of this objective account and sketches an alternative understanding of the body across a series of domains, including the experience of one’s own body, lived space, sexuality, and language. Through a contrast with pathological cases such as phantom limbs, Merleau-Ponty describes the body’s typical mode of existence as “being-toward-the-world”—a pre-objective orientation toward a vital situation that is explicable neither in terms of third-person causal interactions nor by explicit judgments or representations. The body’s orientation toward the world is essentially temporal, involving a dialectic between the present body (characterized, after Husserl, as an “I can”) and the habit body, the sedimentations of past activities that take on a general, anonymous, and autonomous character. While the body’s relation to the world serves as the essential background for the experience of any particular thing, the body itself is experienced in ways that distinguish it in kind from all other things: it is a permanent part of one’s perceptual field, even though one cannot in principle experience all of it directly; it has “double sensations”, such as when one hand touches another, that enact a form of reflexivity; it has affective experiences that are not merely representations; and its kinesthetic sense of its own movements is given directly.

This kinesthetic awareness is made possible by a pre-conscious system of bodily movements and spatial equivalences that Merleau-Ponty terms the “body schema”. In contrast with the “positional spatiality” of things, the body has a “situational spatiality” that is oriented toward actual or possible tasks (PP: 129/102). The body’s existence as “being-toward-the-world”, as a projection toward lived goals, is therefore expressed through its spatiality, which forms the background against which objective space is constituted. Merleau-Ponty introduces here the famous case of Schneider, whose reliance on pathological substitutions for normal spatial abilities helps to brings the body’s typical relationship with lived space to light. Schneider lacks the ability to “project” into virtual space; more generally, his injury has disrupted the “intentional arc” that

projects around us our past, our future, our human milieu, our physical situation, our ideological situation, and our moral situation, or rather, that ensures that we are situated within all of these relationships. (PP: 170/137)

The body’s relationship with space is therefore intentional, although as an “I can” rather than an “I think”; bodily space is a multi-layered manner of relating to things, so that the body is not “in” space but lives or inhabits it.

Just as bodily space reflects an originary form of intentionality—a pre-cognitive encounter with the world as meaningfully structured—the same is shown to be the case for sexuality and for language. Sexuality takes on a special significance because it essentially expresses the metaphysical drama of the human condition while infusing the atmosphere of our lives with sexual significance. Like space and sexuality, speech is also a form of bodily expression. Language does not initially encode ready-made thoughts but rather expresses through its style or physiognomy as a bodily gesture. We mistake language for a determined code by taking habitual or sedimented language as our model, thereby missing “authentic” or creative speech. Since language, like perception, hides its own operations in carrying us toward its meaning, it offers an ideal of truth as its presumptive limit, inspiring our traditional privileging of thought or reason as detachable from all materiality. But, at a fundamental level, language is comparable to music in the way that it remains tied to its material embodiment; each language is a distinct and ultimately untranslatable manner of “singing the world”, of extracting and expressing the “emotional essence” of our surroundings and relationships (PP: 228/193).

Having rediscovered the body as expressive and intentional, Merleau-Ponty turns in Part Two of Phenomenology to the perceived world, with the aim of showing how the pre-reflective unity of co-existence that characterizes the body has as its correlate the synthesis of things and the world; “One’s own body is in the world just as the heart is in the organism” (PP: 245/209), and its expressive unity therefore also extends to the sensible world. Merleau-Ponty develops this interpretation of the sensible through detailed studies of sensing, space, and the natural and social worlds. Sensing takes place as the “co-existence” or “communion” of the body with the world that Merleau-Ponty describes as a reciprocal exchange of question and answer:

a sensible that is about to be sensed poses to my body a sort of confused problem. I must find the attitude that will provide it with the means to become determinate … I must find the response to a poorly formulated question. And yet I only do this in response to its solicitation… . The sensible gives back to me what I had lent to it, but I received it from the sensible in the first place. (PP: 259/222)

As co-existence, sensing is characterized by an intentionality that sympathetically attunes itself to the sensed according to a dialectic in which both terms—the perceiving body and the perceived thing—are equally active and receptive: the thing invites the body to adopt the attitude that will lead to its disclosure. Since the subject of this perception is not the idealist’s “for itself”, neither is the object of perception the realist’s “in itself”; rather, the agent of perception is the pre-reflective and anonymous subjectivity of the body, which remains enmeshed in and “connatural” with the world that it perceives. The senses are unified without losing their distinctness in a fashion comparable to the binocular synthesis of vision, and their anonymity is a consequence of the “historical thickness” of perception as a tradition that operates beneath the level of reflective consciousness (PP: 285/248). For first-person awareness, one’s anonymous perceptual engagement with the world operates as a kind of “original past, a past that has never been present” (PP: 252/252).

The pre-historical pact between the body and the world informs our encounters with space, revealing a synthesis of space that is neither “spatialized” (as a pre-given container in which things are arranged) nor “spatializing” (like the homogenous and interchangeable relations of geometrical space). Drawing on psychological experiments concerning bodily orientation, depth, and movement, Merleau-Ponty argues that empiricist and intellectualist accounts of space must give way to a conception of space as co-existence or mutual implication characterized by existential “levels”: our orientation toward up and down, or toward what is in motion or stationary, is a function of the body’s adoption of a certain level within a revisable field of possibilities. Lived inherence in space contrasts with the abstract space of the analytical attitude, revindicating the existential space of night, dreams, or myths in relation to the abstract space of the “objective” world.

The properties of things that we take to be “real” and “objective” also tacitly assume a reference to the body’s norms and its adoption of levels. An object’s “true” qualities depend on the body’s privileging of orientations that yield maximum clarity and richness. This is possible because the body serves as a template for the style or logic of the world, the concordant system of relations that links the qualities of an object, the configuration of the perceptual field, and background levels such as lighting or movement. In this symbiosis or call-and-response between the body and the world, things have sense as the correlates of my body, and reality therefore always involves a reference to perception. Yet, to be real, things cannot be reducible to correlates of the body or perception; they retain a depth and resistance that provides their existential index. While each thing has its individual style, the world is the ultimate horizon or background style against which any particular thing can appear. The perspectival limitations of perception, both spatially and temporality, are the obverse of this world’s depth and inexhaustibility. Through an examination of hallucination and illusions, Merleau-Ponty argues that skepticism about the existence of the world makes a category mistake. While we can doubt any particular perception, illusions can appear only against the background of the world and our primordial faith in it. While we never coincide with the world or grasp it with absolute certainty, we are also never entirely cut off from it; perception essentially aims toward truth, but any truth that it reveals is contingent and revisable.

Rejecting analogical explanations for the experience of other people, Merleau-Ponty proposes that the rediscovery of the body as a “third genre of being between the pure subject and the object” makes possible encounters with embodied others (PP: 407/366). We perceive others directly as pre-personal and embodied living beings engaged with a world that we share in common. This encounter at the level of anonymous and pre-personal lives does not, however, present us with another person in the full sense, since our situations are never entirely congruent. The perception of others involves an alterity, a resistance, and a plenitude that are never reducible to what is presented, which is the truth of solipsism. Our common corporeality nevertheless opens us onto a shared social world, a permanent dimension of our being in the mode of the anonymous and general “someone”. The perception of others is therefore a privileged example of the paradox of transcendence running through our encounter with the world as perceived:

Whether it is a question of my body, the natural world, the past, birth or death, the question is always to know how I can be open to phenomena that transcend me and that, nevertheless, only exist to the extent that I take them up and live them. (PP: 422/381)

This “fundamental contradiction” defines our encounters with every form of transcendence and requires new conceptions of consciousness, time, and freedom.

The fourth and final section of Phenomenology explores these three themes, starting with a revision of the concept of the cogito that avoids reducing it to merely episodic psychological fact or elevating it to a universal certainly of myself and my cogitationes. Merleau-Ponty argues that we cannot separate the certainty of our thoughts from that of our perceptions, since to truly perceive is to have confidence in the veracity of one’s perceptions. Furthermore, we are not transparent to ourselves, since our “inner states” are available to us only in a situated and ambiguous way. The genuine cogito, Merleau-Ponty argues, is a cogito “in action”: we do not deduce “I am” from “I think”, but rather the certainty of “I think” rests on the “I am” of existential engagement. More basic than explicit self-consciousness and presupposed by it is an ambiguous mode of self-experience that Merleau-Ponty terms the silent or “tacit” cogito—our pre-reflective and inarticulate grasp on the world and ourselves that becomes explicit and determinate only when it finds expression for itself. The illusions of pure self-possession and transparency—like all apparently “eternal” truths—are the results of acquired or sedimented language and concepts.

Rejecting classic approaches to time that treat it either as an objective property of things, as a psychological content, or as the product of transcendental consciousness, Merleau-Ponty return to the “field of presence” as our foundational experience of time. This field is a network of intentional relations, of “protentions” and “retentions”, in a single movement of dehiscence or self-differentiation, such that “each present reaffirms the presence of the entire past that it drives away, and anticipates the presence of the entire future or the ‘to-come’” (PP: 483/444). Time in this sense is “ultimate subjectivity”, understood not as an eternal consciousness, but rather as the very act of temporalization. As with the tacit cogito, the auto-affection of time as ultimate subjectivity is not a static self-identity but involves a dynamic opening toward alterity. In this conception of time as field of presence, which “reveals the subject and the object as two abstract moments of a unique structure, namely, presence” (PP: 494/454–55), Merleau-Ponty sees the resolution to all problems of transcendence as well as the foundation for human freedom. Against the Sartrean position that freedom is either total or null, Merleau-Ponty holds that freedom emerges only against the background of our “universal engagement in a world”, which involves us in meanings and values that are not of our choosing. We must recognize, first, an “authochthonous sense of the world that is constituted in the exchange between the world and our embodied existence” (PP: 504/466), and, second, that the acquired habits and the sedimented choices of our lives have their own inertia. This situation does not eliminate freedom but is precisely the field in which it can be achieved. Taking class consciousness as his example, Merleau-Ponty proposes that this dialectic of freedom and acquisition provides the terms for an account of history, according to which history can develop a meaning and a direction that are neither determined by events nor necessarily transparent to those who live through it.

The Preface to Phenomenology of Perception, completed after the main text, offers Merleau-Ponty’s most detailed and systematic exposition of the phenomenological method. His account is organized around four themes: the privileging of description over scientific explanation or idealist reconstruction, the phenomenological reduction, the eidetic reduction, and intentionality. Phenomenology sets aside all scientific or naturalistic explanations of phenomena in order to describe faithfully the pre-scientific experience that such explanations take for granted. Similarly, since the world exists prior to reflective analysis or judgment, phenomenology avoids reconstructing actual experience in terms of its conditions of possibility or the activity of consciousness. The phenomenological reduction, on his interpretation, is not an idealistic method but an existential one, namely, the reflective effort to disclose our pre-reflective engagement with the world. Through the process of the reduction, we discover the inherence of the one who reflects in the world that is reflected on, and consequently, the essentially incomplete character of every act of reflection, which is why Merleau-Ponty claims that the “most important lesson of the reduction is the impossibility of a complete reduction” (PP: 14/lxxvii). Similarly, the “eidetic reduction”, described by Husserl as the intuition of essential relations within the flux of conscious experience, is necessary if phenomenology is to make any descriptive claims that go beyond the brute facts of a particular experience. But this does not found the actual world on consciousness as the condition of the world’s possibility; instead, “the eidetic method is that of a phenomenological positivism grounding the possible upon the real” (PP: 17/lxxxi). Lastly, Merleau-Ponty reinterprets the phenomenological concept of intentionality, traditionally understood as the recognition that all consciousness is consciousness of something. Following Husserl, he distinguishes the “act intentionality” of judgments and voluntary decisions from the “operative intentionality” that “establishes the natural and pre-predicative unity of the world and of our life” (PP: 18/lxxxii). Guided by this broader concept of intentionality, philosophy’s task is to take in the “total intention” of a sensible thing, a philosophical theory, or an historical event, which is its “unique manner of existing” or its “existential structure” (PP: 19–20/lxxxii–lxxxiii). Phenomenology thereby expresses the emergence of reason and meaning in a contingent world, a creative task comparable to that of the artist or the political activist, which requires an ongoing “radical” or self-referential reflection on its own possibilities. On Merleau-Ponty’s presentation, the tensions of phenomenology’s method therefore reflect the nature of its task:

The unfinished nature of phenomenology and the inchoative style in which it proceeds are not the sign of failure, they were inevitable because phenomenology’s task was to reveal the mystery of the world and the mystery of reason. (PP: 21–22/lxxxv)

4. Expression, Language, and Art

The concepts of expression and style are central to Merleau-Ponty’s thought and already play a key role in his first two books, where they characterize the perceptual exchange between an organism and its milieu, the body’s sensible dialogue with the world, and even the act of philosophical reflection (see Landes 2013). In both works, Merleau-Ponty draws on a range of literary and artistic examples to describe the creative and expressive dimensions of perception and reflection, emphasizing in particular the parallels between the task of the artist and that of the thinker: as the concluding lines of the Preface to Phenomenology of Perception note,

Phenomenology is as painstaking as the works of Balzac, Proust, Valéry, or Cézanne—through the same kind of attention and wonder, the same demand for awareness, the same will to grasp the sense of the world or of history in its nascent state. (PP: 22/lxxxv)

Expression, particularly in language and the arts, plays an increasingly central role in Merleau-Ponty’s thought in the years following Phenomenology, when he aimed to formulate a general theory of expression as the grounding for a philosophy of history and culture.[5] This interest is first reflected in a series of essays addressing painting, literature, and film published in the years immediately following Phenomenology (in Merleau-Ponty 1996b/1964). These include Merleau-Ponty’s first essay on painting, “Cézanne’s Doubt”, which finds in Cézanne a proto-phenomenological effort to capture the birth of perception through painting. Cézanne epitomizes the paradoxical struggle of creative expression, which necessarily relies on the idiosyncracies of the artist’s individual history and psychology, as well as the resources of the tradition of painting, but can succeed only by risking a creative appropriation of these acquisitions in the service of teaching its audience to see the world anew. Similarly, Leonardo da Vinci’s artistic productivity is explicable neither in terms of his intellectual freedom (Valéry) nor his childhood (Freud) but as the dialectic of spontaneity and sedimentation by which Merleau-Ponty had formerly defined history.

In 1951, Merleau-Ponty summarizes his research after Phenomenology as focused on a “theory of truth” exploring how knowledge and communication with others are “original formations with respect to perceptual life, but … also preserve and continue our perceptual life even while transforming it” (UMP: 41–42/287). Expression, language, and symbolism are the key to this theory of truth and provide the foundation for a philosophy of history and of “transcendental” humanity. Whereas the study of perception could only provide a “bad ambiguity” that mixes “finitude and universality”, Merleau-Ponty sees in the phenomenon of expression a “good ambiguity” that “gathers together the plurality of monads, the past and the present, nature and culture, into a single whole” (UMP: 48/290). Many of Merleau-Ponty’s courses from 1947 through 1953 at the University of Lyon, the Sorbonne, and the Collège de France focus on language, expression, and literature.[6]

The manuscript partially completed during these years and published posthumously as The Prose of the World (1969/1973) pursues these themes through a phenomenological investigation of literary language and its relationship with scientific language and painting. Critiquing our commonsense ideal of a pure language that would transparently encode pre-existing thoughts, Merleau-Ponty argues that instituted language—the conventional system of language as an established set of meanings and rules—is derivative from a more primordial function of language as genuinely creative, expressive, and communicative. Here he draws two insights from Saussurian linguistics: First, signs function diacritically, through their lateral relations and differentiations, rather than through a one-to-one correspondence with a conventionally established meaning. Ultimately, signification happens through the differences between terms in a referential system that lacks any fixed or positive terms. This insight into diacritical difference will later prove important to Merleau-Ponty’s understanding of perception and ontology as well (see Alloa 2013a). Second, the ultimate context for the operation of language is effective communication with others, by which new thoughts can be expressed and meanings shared. Expression accomplishes itself through a coherent reorganization of the relationships between acquired signs that must teach itself to the reader or listener, and which may afterwards again sediment into a taken-for-granted institutional structure.

In a long extract from the manuscript that was revised and published in 1952 as “Indirect Language and the Voices of Silence” (in Merleau-Ponty 1960/1964), Merleau-Ponty brings this understanding of language into conversation with Sartre’s What is Literature? and André Malraux’s The Voices of Silence. Sharing Malraux’s criticisms of the museum’s role in framing the reception of painting, but rejecting his interpretation of modern painting as subjectivist, Merleau-Ponty offers an alternative understanding of “institution” (from Husserl’s Stiftung) as the creative establishment of a new field of meaning that opens an historical development. The style of an artist is not merely subjective but lived as a historical trajectory of expression that begins with perception itself and effects a “coherent deformation” in inherited traditions. Rather than opposed as silent and speaking, painting and language are both continuations of the expressivity of a perceptual style into more malleable mediums. The unfinished character of modern painting is therefore not a turn from the objectivity of representation toward subjective creation but rather a more authentic testament to the paradoxical logic of all expression.

Merleau-Ponty returns to the analysis of painting in his final essay, “Eye and Mind” (1964a OEE), where he accords it an ontological priority—between the linguistic arts and music—for revealing the “there is” of the world that the operationalism of contemporary science has occluded. It is by “lending his body to the world that the artist changes the world into paintings” (OEE: 16/353), and this presupposes that the artist’s body is immersed in and made of the same stuff as the world: to touch, one must be tangible, and to see, visible. Merleau-Ponty describes this as an “intertwining” or “overlapping”, in which the artist’s situated embodiment is the other side of its opening to the world. There is as yet no sharp division between the sensing and the sensed, between body and things as one common “flesh”, and painting arises as the expression of this relation: it is a “visible to the second power, a carnal essence or icon” of embodied vision (OEE: 22/355). Descartes’s efforts, in the Optics, to reconstruct vision from thought leads him to focus on the “envelope” or form of the object, as presented in engraved lines, and to treat depth as a third dimension modeled after height and width. This idealization of space has its necessity, yet, once elevated to a metaphysical status by contemporary science, it culminates in an understanding of being as purely positive and absolutely determinate. The ontological significance of modern painting and the plastic arts—e.g., Klee, de Staël, Cézanne, Matisse, Rodin—lies in the alternative philosophy that they embody, as revealed through their treatment of depth, color, line, and movement. Ultimately, such works teach us anew what it means to see:

Vision is not a certain mode of thought or presence to self; it is the means given me for being absent from myself, for being present from the inside at the fission of Being only at the end of which do I close up into myself. (OEE: 81/374)

5. Political Philosophy

From the first issue of Les Temps Modernes in October 1945 until his death, Merleau-Ponty wrote regularly on politics, including reflections on contemporary events as well as explorations of their philosophical underpinnings and the broader political significance of his times. During his eight-year tenure as unofficial managing editor of Les Temps Modernes, he charted the review’s political direction and penned many of its political editorials. After leaving Les Temps Modernes in 1953, Merleau-Ponty found new outlets for his political writings, including L’Express, a weekly newspaper devoted to the non-communist left. Both of the essay collections that he published during his lifetime, Sense and Non-Sense and Signs, devote significant space to his political writings. He also published two volumes devoted entirely to political philosophy, Humanism and Terror (HT) and Adventures of the Dialectic (1955 AdD). Always writing from the left, Merleau-Ponty’s position gradually shifted from a qualified Marxism, maintaining a critical distance from liberal democracy as well as from Soviet communism, to the rejection of revolutionary politics in favor of a “new liberalism”. His political writings have received relatively scant attention compared with other aspects of his philosophy, perhaps because of their close engagement with the political situations and events of his day. Nevertheless, scholars of his political thought emphasize its continuity with his theoretical writings and ongoing relevance for political philosophy (see Coole 2007; Whiteside 1998).

The 1947 publication of Humanism and Terror responded to growing anti-communist sentiment in France fueled in part by the fictional account of the Moscow trials in Arthur Koestler’s popular novel Darkness at Noon. Merleau-Ponty sought to articulate an alternative to the choice Europe apparently faced in the solidifying opposition between the United States and the Soviet Union. Humanism and Terror criticizes Koestler’s portrayal of the fictional Rubochov, modeled on Nikolai Bukharin, for replacing the “mutual praxis” of genuine Marxism (HT: 102/18) with an opposition between pure freedom and determined history, the “yogi” who withdraws into spiritual ideals or the “commissar” who acts by any means necessary. Turning to an examination of Bukharin’s 1938 trial, Merleau-Ponty finds there an example of “revolutionary justice” that “judges in the name of the Truth that the Revolution is about to make true” (HT: 114/28), even though the historical contingency that this entails is denied by the procedures of the trials themselves. On the other hand, Trotsky’s condemnation of Stalinism as counter-revolutionary similarly misses the ambiguity of genuine history. Ultimately, the dimension of terror that history harbors is a consequence of our unavoidable responsibility in the face of its essential contingency and ambiguity.

Although violence is a consequence of the human condition and therefore the starting point for politics, Merleau-Ponty finds hope in the theory of the proletariat for a fundamental transformation in the terms of human recognition:

The proletariat is universal de facto, or manifestly in its very condition of life…. [I]t is the sole authentic intersubjectivity because it alone lives simultaneously the separation and union of individuals. (HT: 221/116–17)

A genuinely historical Marxism must recognize that nothing guarantees progress toward a classless society, but also that this end cannot be brought about by non-proletarian means, which is what Soviet communism had apparently forgotten. Despite the failures of the Soviet experiment, Merleau-Ponty remains committed to a humanist Marxism:

Marxism is not just any hypothesis that might be replaced tomorrow by some other. It is the simple statement of those conditions without which there would be neither any humanism, in the sense of a mutual relation between men, nor any rationality in history. In this sense Marxism is not a philosophy of history; it is the philosophy of history and to renounce it is to dig the grave of Reason in history. (HT: 266/153)

Even if the proletariat is not presently leading world history, its time may yet come. Merleau-Ponty therefore concludes with a “wait-and-see” Marxism that cautions against decontextualized criticisms of Soviet communism as well as apologetics for liberal democracies that whitewash their racist and colonial violence.

Revelations about the Gulag camps and the outbreak of the Korean War forced Merleau-Ponty to revise his position on Marxism and revolutionary politics, culminating in the 1955 Adventures of the Dialectic (AdD). The book begins with the formulation of a general theory of history in conversation with Max Weber. Historians necessarily approach the past through their own perspectives, but, since they are themselves a part of history’s movement, this need not compromise their objectivity. The historical events and periods within which the historian traces a particular style or meaning emerge in conjunction with historical agents, political actors or classes, who exercise a creative action parallel to the expressive gesture of the artist or the writer. History may eliminate false paths, but it guarantees no particular direction, leaving to historical agents the responsibility for the continuation or transformation of what is inherited from the past through a genius for inventing what the times demand: “In politics, truth is perhaps only this art of inventing what will later appear to have been required by the time” (AdD: 42/29). Merleau-Ponty finds a similar position articulated by the young Georg Lukacs, for whom “There is only one knowledge, which is the knowledge of our world in a state of becoming, and this becoming embraces knowledge itself” (AdD: 46/32). History forms a third order, beyond subjects and objects, of interhuman relations inscribed in cultural objects and institutions, and with its own logic of sedimentation and spontaneity. The self-consciousness that emerges within this third order is precisely the proletariat, whose consciousness is not that of an “I think” but rather the praxis of their common situation and system of action. Historical truth emerges from the movement of creative expression whereby the Party brings the life of the proletariat to explicit awareness, which requires, in return, that the working class recognize and understand itself in the Party’s formulations.

With this understanding, Lukacs aims to preserve the dialectic of history, to prevent it from slipping into a simple materialism, and thereby to discover the absolute in the relative. But Lukacs backtracks on this position after its official rejection by the communist establishment in favor of a metaphysical materialism, and Merleau-Ponty finds a parallel in Marx’s own turn away from genuine dialectic toward a simple naturalism that justifies any action in the name of a historical necessity inscribed in things. For the lack of a genuine concept of institution that can recognize dialectic in embodied form, Marxist materialism repeatedly abandons its dialectical aspirations, as Merleau-Ponty further illustrates through the example of Trostky’s career.

In the final chapter of Adventures, Merleau-Ponty turns his sights toward Sartre’s endorsement of communism in The Communists and Peace. On Merleau-Ponty’s interpretation, Sartre’s ontological commitment to a dualism of being and nothingness, where the full positivity of determinate things juxtaposes with the negating freedom of consciousness, eliminates any middle ground for history or praxis. Since consciousness is unconstrained by any sedimentation or by the autonomous life of cultural acquisitions, it can recognize no inertia or spontaneity at the level of institutions, and therefore no genuine historical becoming. More centrally, by interpreting the relation between the Party and the proletariat through his own conception of consciousness as pure freedom, Sartre rules out in principle any possibility for their divergence. This leads Sartre to an “ultrabolshevism” according to which the Party’s position is identified with the revolutionary agenda, any opposition to which must be suppressed.

In the Epilogue that summarizes Merleau-Ponty’s own position, he explains his rejection of revolutionary action, understood as proletarian praxis, for remaining equivocal rather than truly dialectical. The illusion that has brought dialectic to a halt is precisely the investment of history’s total meaning in the proletariat, ultimately equating the proletariat with dialectic as such, which leads to the conviction that revolution would liquidate history itself. But it is essential to the very structure of revolutions that, when successful, they betray their own revolutionary character by sedimenting into institutions. Drawing on the extended example of the French revolution, Merleau-Ponty argues that every revolution mistakes the structure of history for its contents, believing that eliminating the latter will absolutely transform the former. Thus, “The very nature of revolution is to believe itself absolute and to not be absolute precisely because it believes itself to be so” (AdD: 298/222). While Soviet communism may continue to justify itself in absolute terms, it is concretely a progressivism that tacitly recognizes the relativity of revolution and the gradual nature of progress. The alternative that Merleau-Ponty endorses is the development of a “noncommunist left”, an “a-communism”, or a “new liberalism”, the first commitment of which would be to reject the description of the rivalry between the two powers as one between “free enterprise” and Marxism (AdD: 302–3/225). This noncommunist left would occupy a “double position”, “posing social problems in terms of [class] struggle” while also “refusing the dictatorship of the proletariat” (AdD: 304/226). This pursuit must welcome the resources of parliamentary debate, in clear recognition of their limitations, since Parliament is “the only known institution that guarantees a minimum of opposition and of truth” (AdD: 304/226). By exercising “methodical doubt” toward the established powers and denying that they exhaust political and economic options, the possibility opens for a genuine dialectic that advances social justice while respecting political freedom.

6. The Visible and the Invisible

The manuscript and working notes published posthumously as The Visible and the Invisible (1964 V&I), extracted from a larger work underway at the time of Merleau-Ponty’s death, is considered by many to be the best presentation of his later ontology. The main text, drafted in 1959 and 1960, is contemporaneous with “Eye and Mind” and the Preface to Signs, Merleau-Ponty’s final collection of essays. The first three chapters progressively develop an account of “philosophical interrogation” in critical dialogue with scientism, the philosophies of reflection (Descartes and Kant), Sartrean negation, and the intuitionisms of Bergson and Husserl. These are followed by a stand-alone chapter, “The Intertwining—The Chiasm”, presenting Merleau-Ponty’s ontology of flesh. The published volume also includes a brief abandoned section of the text as an appendix and more than a hundred pages of selected working notes composed between 1959 and 1961.[7]

Merleau-Ponty frames the investigation with a description of “perceptual faith”, our shared pre-reflective conviction that perception presents us with the world as it actually is, even though this perception is mediated, for each of us, by our bodily senses. This apparent paradox creates no difficulties in our everyday lives, but it becomes incomprehensible when thematized by reflection:

The “natural” man holds on to both ends of the chain, thinks at the same time that his perception enters into the things and that it is formed this side of his body. Yet coexist as the two convictions do without difficulty in the exercise of life, once reduced to theses and to propositions they destroy one another and leave us in confusion. (V&I: 23–24/8)

For Merleau-Ponty, this “unjustifiable certitude of a sensible world” is the starting point for developing an alternative account of perception, the world, intersubjective relations, and ultimately being as such. Neither the natural sciences nor psychology provide an adequate clarification of this perceptual faith, since they rely on it without acknowledgment even as their theoretical constructions rule out its possibility. Philosophies of reflection, exemplified by Descartes and Kant, also fail in their account of perception, since they reduce the perceived world to an idea, equate the subject with thought, and undermine any understanding of intersubjectivity or a world shared in common (V&I: 62/39, 67/43).

Sartre’s dialectic of being (in-itself) and nothingness (for-itself) makes progress over philosophies of reflection insofar as it recognizes the ecceity of the world, with which the subject engages not as one being alongside others but rather as a nothingness, that is, as a determinate negation of a concrete situation that can co-exist alongside other determinate negations. Even so, for Sartre, pure nothingness and pure being remain mutually exclusive, ambivalently identical in their perfect opposition, which brings any movement of their dialectic to a halt. The “philosophy of negation” is therefore shown to be a totalizing or “high-altitude” thought that remains abstract, missing the true opening onto the world made possible by the fact that nothingness is “sunken into being” (V&I: 121–122/88–89). This “bad” dialectic must therefore give way to a “hyperdialectic” that remains self-critical about its own tendency to reify into fixed and opposed theses (V&I: 129/94).

The philosophy of intuition takes two forms: the Wesenschau of Husserl, which converts lived experience into ideal essences before a pure spectator, and Bergsonian intuition, which seeks to coincide with its object by experiencing it from within. Against the first, Merleau-Ponty argues that the world’s givenness is more primordial than the ideal essence; the essence is a variant of the real, not its condition of possibility. Essences are not ultimately detachable from the sensible but are its “invisible” or its latent structure of differentiation. Against a return to the immediacy of coincidence or a nostalgia for the pre-reflective, Merleau-Ponty holds that there is no self-identical presence to rejoin; the “immediate” essentially involves distance and non-coincidence. Consequently, truth must be redefined as “a privative non-coinciding, a coinciding from afar, a divergence, and something like a ‘good error’” (V&I: 166/124–25).

In the final chapter, “The Intertwining—The Chiasm”, Merleau-Ponty turns directly to the positive project of describing his ontology of “flesh”. Intertwining [entrelacs] here translates Husserl’s Verflechtung, entanglement or interweaving, like the woof and warp of a fabric. Chiasm has two senses in French and English that are both relevant to Merleau-Ponty’s project: a physiological sense that refers to anatomical or genetic structures with a crossed arrangement (such as the optic nerves), and a literary sense referring to figures of speech that repeat structures in reverse order (AB:BA). For Merleau-Ponty, the chiasm is a structure of mediation that combines the unity-in-difference of its physiological sense with the reversal and circularity of its literary usage (see Toadvine 2012; Saint Aubert 2005). A paradigmatic example of chiasmic structure is the body’s doubling into sensible and sentient aspects during self-touch. Elaborating on Husserl’s descriptions of this phenomenon, Merleau-Ponty emphasizes three consequences: First, the body as sensible-sentient is an “exemplar sensible” that demonstrates the kinship or ontological continuity between subject and object among sensible things in general. Second, this relationship is reversible, like “obverse and reverse” or “two segments of one sole circular course” (V&I: 182/138). Third, the sentient and sensible never strictly coincide but are always separated by a gap or divergence [écart] that defers their unity.

Chiasm is therefore a crisscrossing or a bi-directional becoming or exchange between the body and things that justifies speaking of a “flesh” of things, a kinship between the sensing body and sensed things that makes their communication possible. Flesh in this sense is a “general thing” between the individual and the idea that does not correspond to any traditional philosophical concept, but is closest to the notion of an “element” in the classical sense (V&I: 184/139). Merleau-Ponty denies that this is a subjective or anthropocentric projection:

carnal being, as a being of depths, of several leaves or several faces, a being in latency, and a presentation of a certain absence, is a prototype of Being, of which our body, the sensible sentient, is a very remarkable variant, but whose constitutive paradox already lies in every visible. (V&I: 179/136)

The generality of flesh embraces an intercorporeity, an anonymous sensibility shared out among distinct bodies: just as my two hands communicate across the lateral synergy of my body, I can touch the sensibility of another: “The handshake too is reversible” (V&I: 187/142).

Sensible flesh—what Merleau-Ponty calls the “visible”—is not all there is to flesh, since flesh also “sublimates” itself into an “invisible” dimension: the “rarified” or “glorified” flesh of ideas. Taking as his example the “little phrase” from Vinteuil’s sonata (in Swann’s Way), Merleau-Ponty describes literature, music, and the passions as “the exploration of an invisible and the disclosure of a universe of ideas”, although in such cases these ideas “cannot be detached from the sensible appearance and be erected into a second positivity” (V&I: 196/149). Creative language necessarily carries its meaning in a similarly embodied fashion, while the sediments of such expression result in language as a system of formalized relations. What we treat as “pure ideas” are nothing more than a certain divergence and ongoing process of differentiation, now occurring within language rather than sensible things. Ultimately we find a relation of reversibility within language like that holding within sensibility: just as, in order to see, my body must be part of the visible and capable of being seen, so, by speaking, I make myself one who can be spoken to (allocutary) and one who can be spoken about (delocutary). While all of the possibilities of language are already outlined or promised within the sensible world, reciprocally the sensible world itself is unavoidably inscribed with language.

This final chapter of The Visible and the Invisible illustrates chiasmic mediation across a range of relations, including sentient and sensed, touch and vision, body and world, self and other, fact and essence, perception and language. There is not one chiasm but rather various chiasmic structures at different levels. As Renaud Barbaras notes,

It is necessary … to picture the universe as intuited by Merleau-Ponty as a proliferation of chiasms that integrate themselves according to different levels of generality. (1991, 352/2004, 307)

The ultimate ontological chiasm, that between the sensible and the intelligible, is matched by an ultimate epistemological chiasm, that of philosophy itself. As Merleau-Ponty writes in a working note from November 1960,

the idea of chiasm, that is: every relation with being is simultaneously a taking and a being held, the hold is held, it is inscribed and inscribed in the same being that it takes hold of. Starting from there, elaborate an idea of philosophy… . It is the simultaneous experience of the holding and the held in all orders. (V&I: 319/266; see also Saint Aubert 2005: 162–64)

7. Influence and Current Scholarship

While the generation of French post-structuralist thinkers who succeeded Merleau-Ponty, including Deleuze, Derrida, Irigaray, and Foucault, typically distanced themselves from his work, lines of influence are often recognizable (see Lawlor 2006, 2003; Reynolds 2004). Irigaray (1993) suggests that Merleau-Ponty’s ontology of flesh tacitly relies on feminine and maternal metaphors while rendering sexual difference invisible. Derrida’s most detailed engagement with Merleau-Ponty, in Le Toucher, Jean-Luc Nancy (On Touching—Jean-Luc Nancy, 2000/2005), criticizes the latter’s account of touch and ontology of flesh for its tendency to privilege immediacy, continuity, and coincidence over rupture, distance, and untouchability. Nevertheless, Derrida ultimately suspends judgment over the relation between these two tendencies in Merleau-Ponty’s final writings. The legacy of Merleau-Ponty’s philosophy of embodiment and ontology of flesh is also apparent in the work of subsequent French phenomenologists, including Françoise Dastur, Michel Henry, Henri Maldiney, Jean-Louis Chrétien, and Jacob Rogozinski.

Recent English-language scholarship on Merleau-Ponty, inspired by the availability of new materials from his course notes and unpublished writings, has focused on his concept of subjectivity (Morris and Maclaren 2015; Welsh 2013; Marratto 2012), his relationship to literature, architecture, and the arts (Carbone 2015; Locke & McCann 2015; Wiskus 2014; Kaushik 2013; Johnson 2010), and his later ontology and philosophy of nature (Foti 2013; Toadvine 2009). His work has also made important contributions to debates in cognitive science (Thompson 2007; Gallagher 2005), feminism (Olkowski and Weiss 2006; Heinämaa 2003), animal studies (Westling 2014; Buchanan 2009; Oliver 2009), and environmental philosophy (Cataldi & Hamrick 2007; Abram 1996).

Bibliography

Cited Works by Merleau-Ponty

Citations of these texts list the French pagination first followed by that of the English translation.

[AdD] 1955, Les aventures de la dialectique, Paris: Gallimard; Adventures of the Dialectic, Joseph Bien (trans.), Evanston: Northwestern University Press, 1973.
[HT] 1947, Humanisme et terreur. Essai sur le problème communiste, Paris: Gallimard; Humanism and Terror: An Essay on the Communist Problem, John O’Neill (trans.), Boston: Beacon Press, 1969.
[IMP] “Un inédit de Maurice Merleau-Ponty,” in Merleau-Ponty 2000, pp. 36–48; “An Unpublished Text by Maurice Merleau-Ponty,” in Merleau-Ponty 2007, pp. 283–290.
[NP] 1933, “La Nature de la Perception” published as an appendix to Geraets (1971), pp. 188–199; “The Nature of Perception,” Forrest Williams (trans.) in Merleau-Ponty 1992, pp. 74–84.
[OEE] 1964a, L’Œil et l’esprit, Paris: Gallimard; “Eye and Mind”, in Merleau-Ponty 2007.
[PP] 1945, Phénoménologie de la perception, Paris: Gallimard; Phenomenology of Perception, Donald Landes (trans.), London: Routledge, 2012.
[RC1] 1988, Merleau-Ponty à la Sorbonne. Résumé de cours 1949–1952, Paris: Cynara; Child Psychology and Pedagogy: The Sorbonne Lectures, 1949–1952, Talia Welsh (trans.), Evanston: Northwestern University Press, 2010.
[RC2] 1968, Résumés de cours, Collège de France 1952–1960, Paris: Gallimard; Themes from the Lectures at the Collège de France, John O’Neill (trans.), Evanston: Northwestern University Press, 1970.
[SC] 1942, La structure du comportement, Paris: Presses Universitaires de France; The Structure of Behavior, Alden Fisher (trans.), Pittsburgh: Duquesne University Press, 1983.
[V&I] 1964c, Le visible et l’invisible, Paris: Gallimard; The Visible and the Invisible, Alphonso Lingis (trans.), Evanston: Northwestern University Press, 1968.

Other Works by Merleau-Ponty

  • 1953, Éloge de la philosophie, Paris: Gallimard; In Praise of Philosophy, John Wild and James Edie (trans.), Evanston: Northwestern University Press, 1963.
  • 1956, (ed.) Les philosophes célèbres, Paris: Mazenod.
  • 1960, Signes, Paris: Gallimard; Signs, Richard McCleary (trans.), Evanston: Northwestern University Press, 1964.
  • 1964b, The Primacy of Perception, James Edie (ed.), Evanston: Northwestern University Press.
  • 1969, La prose du monde, Claude Lefort (ed.), Paris: Gallimard; The Prose of the World, John O’Neill (trans.), Evanston: Northwestern University Press, 1973.
  • 1973, Consciousness and the Acquisition of Language, Hugh J. Silverman (trans.), Evanston: Northwestern University Press.
  • 1992, Texts and Dialogues, Hugh Silverman and James Barry Jr. (eds), New Jersey: Humanities Press.
  • 1995, La nature, notes, cours du Collège de France, Paris: Seuil; Nature: Course Notes from the Collège de France, Robert Vallier (trans.), Evanston: Northwestern University Press, 2003)
  • 1996a, Notes des cours au Collège de France 1958–1959 et 1960–1961, Paris: Gallimard.
  • 1996b, Sens et non-sens, Paris: Gallimard; Sense and Non-Sense, Hubert and Patricia Dreyfus (trans.), Evanston: Northwestern University Press, 1964.
  • 1997a, Parcours 1935–1951, LaGrasse: Verdier.
  • 1997b, L’union de l’âme et du corps chez Malebranche, Biran et Bergson, Jean Deprun (ed.), Paris: Vrin; The Incarnate Subject: Malebranche, Biran, and Bergson on the Union of Body and Soul, Andrew Bjelland Jr. and Patrick Burke (eds), Amherst, NY: Humanity Books, 2001.
  • 1998, Notes de cours sur, L’origine de la géométrie de Husserl, Renaud Barbaras (ed.), Paris: Presses Universitaires de France; Husserl at the Limits of Phenomenology, Leonard Lawlor (ed.) with Bettina Bergo, Evanston: Northwestern University Press, 2002.
  • 2000, Parcours deux 1951–1961, LaGrasse: Verdier.
  • 2002, Causeries 1948, Stéphanie Ménasé (ed.), Paris: Seuil; The World of Perception, Oliver Davis (trans.), London: Routledge, 2004.
  • 2003, L’institution, La passivité. Notes de cours au Collège de France (1954–1955), Tours: Belin; Institution and Passivity: Course Notes from the Collège de France (1954–1955), Leonard Lawlor and Heath Massey (trans.), Evanston: Northwestern University Press, 2010.
  • 2007, The Merleau-Ponty Reader, Leonard Lawlor and Ted toadvine (eds), Evanston: Northwestern University Press.
  • 2008, “La Nature ou le monde du silence (pages d’introduction)”, in Maurice Merleau-Ponty, Emmanuel de Saint Aubert (ed.), Paris: Mermann Éditeurs, 41–53.
  • 2010, Oeuvres, Paris: Gallimard.
  • 2011, Le monde sensible et le monde de l’expression. Cours au Collège de France, Notes, 1953, Geneva: MētisPresses.
  • 2013, Recherches sur l’usage littéraire du langage. Course au Collège de France, Notes, 1953, Geneva: MētisPresses.

Selected Secondary Literature

  • Abram, David, 1996, The Spell of the Sensuous, New York: Vintage Books.
  • Alloa, Emmanuel. 2013a, “The Diacriticial Nature of Meaning: Merleau-Ponty with Saussure”, Chiasmi International, 15: 167–181.
  • –––. 2013b, “Merleau-Ponty, tout un roman”, Le Monde.fr, 10/24/2013, <available online>, accessed 10 June 2016.
  • Barbaras, Renaud, 1991, De l’être du phénomène. Sur l’ontologie de Merleau-Ponty, Grenoble: Jérome Millon; The Being of the Phenomenon: Merleau-Ponty’s Ontology, Ted Toadvine and Leonard Lawlor (trans.), Bloomington: Indiana University Press, 2004.
  • Buchanan, Brett, 2009, Onto-ethologies: The Animal Environments of Uexküll, Heidegger, Merleau-Ponty, and Deleuze, Albany: SUNY Press.
  • Carbone, Mauro, 2015, The Flesh of Images: Merleau-Ponty Between Painting and Cinema, Marta Nijhuis (trans.), Albany: State University of New York Press.
  • Cataldi, Suzanne, and William Hamrick (eds), 2007, Merleau-Ponty and Environmental Philosophy: Dwelling on the Landscapes of Thought, Albany: State University of New York Press.
  • Coole, Diana, 2007, Merleau-Ponty and Modern Politics After Anti-Humanism, Lanham, MD: Rowman and Littlefield.
  • Derrida, Jacques, 2000, Le toucher, Jean-Luc Nancy, Paris: Galilée; On Touching—Jean-Luc Nancy, Christine Irizarry (trans.), Stanford: Stanford University Press, 2005.
  • Dillon, M. C, 1997, Merleau-Ponty’s Ontology, 2nd edition, Evanston: Northwestern University Press.
  • Diprose, Rosalyn, and Jack Reynolds (eds), 2008, Merleau-Ponty: Key Concepts, Stocksfield: Acumen.
  • Foti, Véronique, 2013, Tracing Expression in Merleau-Ponty: Aesthetics, Philosophy of Biology, and Ontology, Evanston: Northwestern University Press.
  • Gallagher, Shaun, 2005, How the Body Shapes the Mind, Oxford: Oxford University Press.
  • Geraets, Theodore F, 1971, Vers une nouvelle philosophie transcendentale, The Hague: Martinus Nijhoff.
  • Heinämaa, Sara, 2003, Toward a Phenomenology of Sexual Difference: Husserl, Merleau-Ponty, Beauvoir, Lanham, MD: Rowman & Littlefield.
  • Irigaray, Luce, 1993, An Ethics of Sexual Difference, Carolyn Burke and Gillian Gill (trans.), Ithaca: Cornell University Press.
  • Johnson, Galen, 2010, The Retrieval of the Beautiful: Thinking Through Merleau-Ponty’s Aesthetics, Evanston: Northwestern University Press.
  • ––– (ed.), 1993, The Merleau-Ponty Aesthetics Reader, Evanston: Northwestern University Press.
  • Kaushik, Rajiv, 2013, Art, Language and Figure in Merleau-Ponty, London: Bloomsbury.
  • Landes, Donald, 2013, Merleau-Ponty and the Paradoxes of Expression, London: Bloomsbury.
  • Lawlor, Leonard, 2003, Thinking through French Philosophy: The Being of the Question, Bloomington: Indiana University Press.
  • –––, 2006, The Implications of Immanence: Toward a New Concept of Life, New York: Fordham University Press.
  • Locke, Patricia, and Rachel McCann (eds), 2015, Merleau-Ponty: Space, Place, and Architecture, Athens: Ohio University Press.
  • Madison, Gary Brent, 1981, The Phenomenology of Merleau-Ponty, Athens: Ohio University Press.
  • Marratto, Scott, 2012, The Intercorporeal Self: Merleau-Ponty on Subjectivity, Albany: SUNY Press.
  • Morris, David, 2004, The Sense of Space, Albany: State University of New York Press.
  • Morris, David, and Kym Maclaren (eds), 2015, Time, Memory, Institution: Merleau-Ponty’s New Ontology of Self, Athens: Ohio University Press.
  • Noble, Stephen, 2011, “Merleau-Ponty Fifty Years After his Death”, Chiasmi International, 13: 63–112.
  • Oliver, Kelly, 2009, Animal Lessons: How They Teach Us to be Human, New York: Columbia University Press.
  • Olkowski, Dorothea and Gail Weiss, 2006, Feminist Interpretations of Maurice Merleau-Ponty, University Park, PA: The Pennsylvania State University Press.
  • Reynolds, Jack, 2004, Merleau-Ponty and Derrida: Intertwining Embodiment and Alterity, Athens: Ohio University Press.
  • Saint Aubert, Emmanuel de, 2004, Du lien des êtres aux éléments de l’être: Merleau-Ponty au tournant des années 1945–1951, Paris: Vrin.
  • –––, 2005, Le scénario cartésien. Recherches sur la formation et la cohérence de l’intention philosophique de Merleau-Ponty, Paris: Vrin.
  • –––, 2013, Être et chair I. Du corps au désir: L’habilitation ontologique de la chair, Paris: Vrin.
  • Sallis, John, 2003, Phenomenology and the Return to Beginnings, 2nd edition, Pittsburgh: Duquesne University Press.
  • Sartre, Jean-Paul, 1965, “Merleau-Ponty”, in Situations, Benita Eisler (trans.), New York: Braziller, 227–326.
  • Stewart, Jon (ed.), 1998, The Debate Between Sartre and Merleau-Ponty, Evanston: Northwestern University Press.
  • Thompson, Evan, 2007, Mind in Life: Biology, Phenomenology, and the Sciences of Mind, Cambridge, MA: Harvard University Press.
  • Toadvine, Ted, 2012, “The Chiasm”, in The Routledge Companion to Phenomenology, Sebastian Luft and Søren Overgaard (eds), London: Routledge, 336–347.
  • –––, 2009, Merleau-Ponty’s Philosophy of Nature, Evanston: Northwestern University Press.
  • ––– (ed.), 2006, Merleau-Ponty: Critical Assessments of Leading Philosophers, vols. 1–4, London: Routledge.
  • Welsh, Talia, 2013, The Child as Natural Phenomenologist: Primal and Primary Experience in Merleau-Ponty’s Psychology, Evanston: Northwestern University Press.
  • Westling, Louise, 2014, The Logos of the Living World: Merleau-Ponty, Animals, and Language, New York: Fordham University Press.
  • Whiteside, Kerry, 1988, Merleau-Ponty and the Foundation of an Existential Politics, Princeton: Princeton University Press.
  • Wiskus, Jessica, 2013, The Rhythm of Thought: Art, Literature, and Music after Merleau-Ponty, Chicago: University of Chicago Press.

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