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Supplement to Set Theory

Zermelo-Fraenkel Set Theory

Axioms of ZF

Extensionality:
xy[z(zxzy)x=y]

This axiom asserts that when sets x and y have the same members, they are the same set.

The next axiom asserts the existence of the empty set:

Null Set:
x¬y(yx)

Since it is provable from this axiom and the previous axiom that there is a unique such set, we may introduce the notation ‘’ to denote it.

The next axiom asserts that if given any set x and y, there exists a pair set of x and y, i.e., a set which has only x and y as members:

Pairs:
xyzw(wzw=xw=y)

Since it is provable that there is a unique pair set for each given x and y, we introduce the notation ‘{x,y}’ to denote it.

The next axiom asserts that for any set x, there is a set y which contains as members all those sets whose members are also elements of x, i.e., y contains all of the subsets of x:

Power Set:
xyz[zyw(wzwx)]

Since every set provably has a unique ‘power set’, we introduce the notation ‘P(x)’ to denote it. Note also that we may define the notion x is a subset of y (‘xy’) as: z(zxzy). Then we may simplify the statement of the Power Set Axiom as follows:

xyz(zyzx)

The next axiom asserts that for any given set x, there is a set y which has as members all of the members of all of the members of x:

Unions:
xyz[zyw(wxzw)]

Since it is provable that there is a unique ‘union’ of any set x, we introduce the notation ‘x’ to denote it.

The next axiom asserts the existence of an infinite set, i.e., a set with an infinite number of members:

Infinity:
x[xy(yx{y,{y}}x)]

We may think of this as follows. Let us define the union of x and y (‘xy’) as the union of the pair set of x and y, i.e., as {x,y}. Then the Axiom of Infinity asserts that there is a set x which contains as a member and which is such that whenever a set y is a member of x, then y{y} is a member of x. Consequently, this axiom guarantees the existence of a set of the following form:

{,{},{,{}},{,{},{,{}}},}

Notice that the second element, {}, is in this set because (1) the fact that is in the set implies that {} is in the set and (2) {} just is {}. Similarly, the third element, {,{}}, is in this set because (1) the fact that {} is in the set implies that {}{{}} is in the set and (2) {}{{}} just is {,{}}. And so forth.

The next axiom is the Separation Schema, which asserts the existence of a set that contains the elements of a given set w that satisfy a certain condition ψ. That is, suppose that ψ(x,ˆu) has x free and may or may not have u1,,uk free. And let ψx,ˆu[r,ˆu] be the result of substituting r for x in ψ(x,ˆu). Then the Separation Schema asserts:

Separation Schema:
u1uk[wvr(rvrwψx,ˆu[r,ˆu])]

In other words, if given a formula ψ and a set w, there exists a set v which has as members precisely the members of w which satisfy the formula ψ.

The next axiom of ZF is the Replacement Schema. Suppose that ϕ(x,y,ˆu) is a formula with x and y free, and let ˆu represent the variables u1,uk, which may or may not be free in ϕ. Furthermore, let ϕx,y,ˆu[s,r,ˆu] be the result of substituting s and r for x and y, respectively, in ϕ(x,y,ˆu). Then every instance of the following schema is an axiom:

Replacement Schema:
u1uk[x!yϕ(x,y,ˆu)wvr(rvs(swϕx,y,ˆu[s,r,ˆu]))]

In other words, if we know that ϕ is a functional formula (which relates each set x to a unique set y), then if we are given a set w, we can form a new set v as follows: collect all of the sets to which the members of w are uniquely related by ϕ.

Note that the Replacement Schema can take you ‘out of’ the set w when forming the set v. The elements of v need not be elements of w. By contrast, the Separation Schema of Zermelo only yields subsets of the given set w.

The final axiom asserts that every set is ‘well-founded’:

Regularity:
x[xy(yxz(zx¬(zy)))]

A member y of a set x with this property is called a ‘minimal’ element. This axiom rules out the existence of circular chains of sets (e.g., such as xyyzzx) as well as infinitely descending chains of sets (such as … x3x2x1x0).

Copyright © 2014 by
Joan Bagaria <joan.bagaria@icrea.cat>

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