1. The reference is to Ulysses tying himself to the mast so that he can hear the sirens’song without jumping overboard.

2. Marriage does not bring benefits exclusively: in the U.S., it can bring a tax ‘penalty’ to dual-income couples with similar incomes as well as a tax ‘bonus’ to disparate-income couples. For a comprehensive summary of the many implications of marriage in U.S. federal law, see the 1997 U.S. General Accounting Office Report on marriage—see Other Internet Resources.