Proof of Proposition 2.17

Proposition 2.17 (Aumann 1976)
Let $\mathcal{M}$ be the meet of the agents’ partitions $\mathcal{H}_i$ for each $i \in N$. A proposition $E \subseteq \Omega$ is common knowledge for the agents of $N$ at $\omega$ iff $\mathcal{M}(\omega) \subseteq E$. In Aumann (1976), $E$ is defined to be common knowledge at $\omega$ iff $\mathcal{M}(\omega) \subseteq E$.

Proof.
$(\Leftarrow)$ By Lemma 2.16, $\mathcal{M}(\omega)$ is common knowledge at $\omega$, so $E$ is common knowledge at $\omega$ by Proposition 2.4.

$(\Rightarrow)$ We must show that $\mathbf{K}^*_N (E)$ implies that $\mathcal{M}(\omega) \subseteq E$. Suppose that there exists $\omega' \in \mathcal{M}(\omega)$ such that $\omega' \not\in E.$ Since $\omega' \in \mathcal{M}(\omega), \omega'$ is reachable from $\omega$, so there exists a sequence $0, 1, \ldots ,m-1$ with associated states $\omega_1, \omega_2 , \ldots ,\omega_m$ and information sets $\mathcal{H}_{i_{ k} }(\omega_k)$ such that $\omega_0 = \omega,$ $\omega_m = \omega',$ and $\omega_k \in \mathcal{H}_{i_k}(\omega_{k+1}).$ But at information set $\mathcal{H}_{i_{ k} }(\omega_m)$, agent $i_k$ does not know event $E$. Working backwards on $k$, we see that event $E$ cannot be common knowledge, that is, agent $i_1$ cannot rule out the possibility that agent $i_2$ thinks that … that agent $i_{m-1}$ thinks that agent $i_m$ does not know $E.$ $\Box$

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