1. Some proponents of the cinematic and retentional models hold that our experiences of succession are strictly momentary or durationless. Others, mindful of the fact that our neural processes do not unfold at infinite speeds, hold that experiences of succession are not instantaneous but themselves have a brief finite temporal extension. Although this “atomist” position—as it is sometimes called, e.g., Lee 2014a—is closer to extensionalism, as Lee himself notes, there remains an important difference. For the extensionalist, temporal experiences occur in temporally extended experiences which possess briefer experiences as (temporal) parts, and relationships between these briefer experiential parts play a key explanatory role in our temporal experience. For the atomist this is not the case.

2. Ian Phillips is a notable dissenter:

it is not clear why we should accept that a genuine how-possible question arises … as yet we have no grounds for thinking that time consciousness is in any way mysterious, let alone impossible. (2014c: 141)

3. Although in pursuing this question we will be traversing a good deal of territory there are interesting topics relating to subjective time we won’t be engaging with; see Wittmann (2014 [2016]) for an accessible introduction to relevant recent work in psychology and neuroscience.

4. Mindful of this point Rashbrook has proposed a more neutral formulation:

The PPC: It seems as if the duration of experience in which an item X is represented is concurrent with the duration that X is represented as occupying. (2013a: 586)

5. William James cites Volkmann, who is praised for expressing the matter admirably:

… If idea A follows idea B, consciousness simply exchanges one for another … if A and B are to be represented as occurring in succession, they must be simultaneously represented. (James 1890: 629, citing Volkmann 1875: §87).

Rashbrook offers a memorably succinct formulation: “The PSA: There are instants at which we experience intervals” (2013a: 593). To capture the must in Volkmann’s formulation we would need to add something along these lines: “and there is no other way to experience intervals”.

6. Bergson also suggests that

[l]anguage cannot get hold of [durée] without arresting its mobility or fit it into common-place forms without making it public property. (Bergson 1889 [1910: 129])

For an insightful exploration of Bergson’s conception of temporal experience see Wolf (2022).

7. Torrengo thinks that it is nonetheless possible to say something more about them. Torrengo suggests that we take the flow-like feature of experience to be a phenomenal modifier. Suppose your eyes are watering, and your vision blurs; you can still see the green cup on your desk a few feet away, but you now see it in a blurry way. Importantly, you don’t (we can suppose) think the cup itself has become blurred, you attribute the blurriness to the way you are currently seeing, thanks to the tears in your eyes. More generally, we can take intrinsic flow-character to be a phenomenal modifier, one that is present in all types forms of consciousness—or so Torrengo proposes.

8. So far as E.R. Clay is concerned, Andersen and Grush (2009: §7) rightly observe that commentators invariably recycle the quote from Clay’s The Alternative supplied by James (as, indeed, has just been done here). They have performed the valuable service of tracking down both Clay and The Alternative. It turns out that “E.R. Clay” is a pseudonym of Robert Kelly, an Irish immigrant to the U.S. who built up a successful cigar company, and took up an interest in philosophy after taking an early retirement. In the same article Andersen and Grush provide a very useful survey of other (non-Germanic) influences on James, e.g., Thomas Reid, Dugald Steward, Thomas Brown, William Hamilton and Shadworth Hodgson. For more on the development of James’ views see Andersen (2014) and Levanon (2016a, 2018). For more on Hodgson—an important influence on James—see Andersen (2017).

9. Not everyone finds James convincing on these points. Galen Strawson rejects James’ stream-metaphor as “inept”, and argues that consciousness is radically discontinuous: “It is always shooting off, fuzzing, shorting out, spurting and stalling.” (1997: 421). In a similar vein, Dennett holds that “One of the most striking features of consciousness is its discontinuity.” (1991: 356).

10. In her forthcoming “The Specious Present in English Philosophy 1749–1785: Theories and Experiments in Hartley, Priestley, Tucker, and Watson” Emily Thomas outlines previously undiscovered work on temporal experience of four mid-18^thcentury English natural philosophers. Although some of this work is philosophical some is experimental, with for example Herschel conducting experiments to measure the minimum duration that we can experience; as Thomas aptly observes “the pre-history of specious present theories is more complex than currently appreciated” (forthcoming: §1)—this pre-history pre-dates the better known mid-19^th century work of Hodgson, Clay, and James

11. Bardon’s claim that Hume should be construed as an early extensionalist is worthy of further investigation. It is worth noting in this connection that there are other Humean doctrines that look to be in tension with extensionalism. Falkenstein (2017: 48) observes that “Hume thought that only one part of time ever exists, and this part is unextended”, which Falkenstein suggests rules out any form of trans-temporal unity of consciousness for Hume. Also see Bardon’s own (2007) for further discussion of difficulties in Hume’s position. For an ingenious attempt to derive a consistent doctrine from Hume’s various and occasionally puzzling remarks on time and temporal concepts in the Treatise in a different way see Baxter (2007).

12. Falkenstein (2017) has suggested that since Reid defended a direct realist theory of memory it would be a mistake to categorize him as holding an antirealist view of temporal experience. Perhaps, but it should be borne in mind that for Reid memory is constituted by a combination of conception and belief—for more see the SEP entry on Thomas Reid.

13. Chuard’s position is similar to the “quasi-realist” in ethics, i.e., someone

who endorses an anti-realist metaphysical stance but who seeks, through philosophical maneuvring, to earn that right for moral discourse to enjoy all the trappings of realist talk.

See Joyce (2021 [2022]: §3.1).

14. There is a potential difference: in the tennis example there are only five distinct experiences, whereas cinematic theorist might insist that on their model we are dealing with a true continuum, in the mathematical sense: involves an infinite number of distinct momentary experiences in succession. But as Bergson was fond of pointing out, numbers make no difference here: the points in the orthodox mathematical continuum are always entirely distinct from one another, no matter how close together they may be: indeed, since these points are densely ordered, between any two points there is always a further point. Poincaré is in sympathy with this, and points out that the orthodox mathematical continuum “is only a collection of individuals ranged in a certain order, infinite in number, true, but exterior to one another” (1913: 43). For more on this theme see Čapek (1971: Part II).

15. Arstila’s explanation rests on the fact that our visual systems have two neural pathways, the fast M-pathway and the slower P-pathway, and is compatible with data that suggests visual stimuli reach consciousness in as little as 240 msec. Piper (2019) appeals to similar considerations in developing an account of apparent motion that is compatible with extensionalism.

16. Galen Strawson defends a version of the retentional model which is broadly similar to Lee’s; Strawson also eschews strictly momentary episodes of experiencing:

What is the duration of the living moment of experience? I take it to be very short indeed. … One thing I take for granted is that experience takes time: it can’t exist or occur at an instant, where an instant is defined as something with no temporal duration at all. So I take “moment” as it features in the expression “living moment of experience” to refer essentially to a temporal interval, however short. (Strawson 2009: 256)

17. Hoerl also suggests a move to representationalism can help explain (some) of what Husserl might mean when he claimed that the “absolute flow” of consciousness—the most fundamental level of temporal awareness—is itself non-temporal; see Hoerl (2013a: 384)

18. Elsewhere, in a more speculative vein, Dainton suggests that co-consciousness is essentially transitive in both the synchronic and diachronic cases, but the passage of time conceals this from us:

The only reason why transitivity fails in the diachronic case is that the passage of time brings with it the annihilation of earlier phases of experience, as new phases are created … If it weren’t for the destructive agency of temporal passage C would be co-conscious with E. (2016: 100)

If time did not pass in this sort of way our experience would not be confined to brief specious presents: all the experiences in our streams of consciousness would be experienced together. Needless to say, this scenario depends on a conception of time which is itself controversial—see §8.1 for more on this.

19. Is that the end of the story? Not necessarily, for the extensional approach is perfectly compatible with versions of presentism which grant to the present a brief duration. It is only presentism of the strictest form which is irreconcilable with the extensional approach—for further discussion of extended presents see Dainton (2001: ch.6 and §7.8 and McKinnon (2003: §10). For further discussion of the relationship between presentism and temporal experience see Frischhut (2017) and Solomyak (2019).

20. In this connection also see Dieks 2016.

21. See Maudlin (2002) for a different—if inevitably controversial—way of resisting Prosser’s conclusion. Maudlin argues that eliminating passage would have dramatic physical consequences even without the A-theorist’s coming-into-being.

22. For an assessment of this panpsychist conclusion see Dainton (forthcomingb).

23. For further discussion of delays in perception see Libet (1993, 2004), Efron (1967) and Pockett (2002, 2003).

24. See Weichselgartner & Sperling (1985), Long & O’Saban (1989) and Nisly-Nagele & Wasserman (2001) for further discussion and references on visual persistence.

25. For a survey of relevant work on the neural bases of temporal processing, see Mauk & Buonomano (2004). Kelly argues that the vast bulk of empirical work is focused on just two questions: How do we come to represent events as occurring at a particular time? Which events to we experience as simultaneous? He draws this conclusion:

The puzzle of temporal experience will not be resolved by empirical research of the type now being done … [the relevant neuroscientific accounts] do not have any bearing at all, in other words, on the question of how we are to conceptualize perceptual experience from the point of view of the subject so as to allow for the possibility of experiences as of continuous, dynamic, temporally structured, unified events. (2005b: §7–7.1)

26. For more on coincidence thresholds see Pockett (2003), Pöppel (1997), Hirsh & Sherrick (1961), Ruhnau (1995); for an interesting exploration of the philosophical significance of perceptual simultaneity windows see Callender (2008).

27. Benussi preferred the term “psychic present”, construing the latter as the “time required to apprehend the maximum number of elements of a change in one single perceptual act” Albertazzi (1994: 161); see also Albertazzi 1996.

28. Of the two most general visual pathways in primates

we find that it is the older tectopulvinar pathway (evolutionarily speaking) that is more involved in motion perception than the newer geniculostriate pathway. There are some suggestions that the tectopulvinar pathway may be entirely specialized for the perception of movement, along with the control of responses that involve moving stimuli, such as some kinds of eye movements. (Coren, Ward, & Enns 2004: 360)

29. There are complications. Although 20–30 fps is sufficient to generates smooth apparent motion, higher rates are needed to eliminate variations in brightness (flicker); accordingly, in cinema and TV the same image is shown two or three times in succession. Three factors are most relevant to the quality of apparent motion: interstimulus interval (the time between the end of one frame and the start of the next), frame duration, and the time between the start of one frame and the start of the next—the latter is the most important single factor. For further detail on a complex topic, “flicker studies”, see Anderson & Anderson (1993), Galifret (2006).

30. As Debru (2001: 478) notes, it may be that James’ figure of 12 seconds was also influenced by Helmholtz’s discovery that after-images typically have a maximal duration of 12 seconds or so.

31. And also when describing Wundt’s attempt to measure the interval which is remembered most accurately:

[this interval] of about three-fourths of a second, which is estimated with the minimum of error, points to a connection between the time-feeling and the succession of distinctly apperceived objects before the mind. The association time is also equal to about three-fourths of a second. This association time he regards as a sort of internal standard of duration to which we involuntarily assimilate all intervals which we try to reproduce, bringing shorter ones up to it and longer ones down. (James 1890: 596–7)

32. Myers (1971: 355) notes that Boring claimed James’ commitment to this approach stemmed from a general doctrine concerning the temporal character of introspection:

introspection was not believed to be a process that takes time … But how then can a duration that takes time be immediately known, since the duration, not being instantaneous, is itself not all immediate? (1942: 576)

Myers has his doubts:

I cannot connect Boring’s remarks with what James wrote in “The Perception of Time” in The Principles of Psychology, because he never said that introspection is instantaneous or that the duration of the specious present is specious. (1971: 355)

Mabbott (1951: 165) usefully summarizes Boring’s changes of view on these matters.

33. See Sprigge (1993: 198–225) for an interesting discussion of how James’ views on time, experience and continuity evolved through his career. Levanon (2016a, 2018) also sheds useful light on James’ views.