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Supplement to Frege’s Theorem and Foundations for Arithmetic

Derivation of the Principle of Extensionality from Basic Law V

[Note: We use ϵF to denote the extension of the concept F.]

Assume Extension(x) and Extension(y). Then F(x=ϵF) and G(y=ϵG). Let P,Q be arbitrary such concepts; i.e., suppose x=ϵP and y=ϵQ.

Now to complete the proof, assume z(zxzy). It then follows that z(zϵPzϵQ). So, by the Law of Extensions and the principles of predicate logic, we may convert both conditions in the universalized biconditional to establish that z(PzQz). So by Basic Law V, ϵP=ϵQ. So x=y.

Copyright © 2023 by
Edward N. Zalta <zalta@stanford.edu>

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