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Notes to Frank Ramsey

1. Wittgenstein’s recollection is apparently mistaken, since he went back to Cambridge in January 1929 and could only have met Ramsey during the last year of his life.

2. The derivation of the ‘equal difference in utility’ definition proceeds as follows. Where p is ethically neutral and the subject not indifferent between ω1 and ω2, bel(p)=0.5 whenever the subject is indifferent between ‘ω1 if p, ω2 otherwise’ and ‘ω2 if p, ω1 otherwise’. To see this, note that under Ramsey's assumed 'general psychological theory', the indifference holds iff

bel(p)des(ω1&p)+(1bel(p))des(ω2&¬p)=
   bel(p)des(ω2&p)+(1bel(p))des(ω1&¬p)

Assuming that p is ethically neutral, this can be re-written:

bel(p)des(ω1)+(1bel(p))des(ω2)=
   bel(p)des(ω2)+(1bel(p))des(ω1)

where des(ω1)des(ω2). From there we can derive by that bel(p)=0.5. Now suppose that p is an ethically neutral proposition of probability 0.5, and that the subject is indifferent between ‘ω1 if p, ω4 if ¬p’ and ‘ω2 if p, ω3 if ¬p’. This holds iff

bel(p)des(ω1&p)+(1bel(p))des(ω4&¬p)=
   bel(p)des(ω2&p)+(1bel(p))des(ω3&¬p)

which we can now reduce to

bel(p)des(ω1)+(1bel(p))des(ω4)=
   bel(p)des(ω2)+(1bel(p))des(ω3)

Since bel(p)=1bel(p), we can drop out the constant factor, leaving us with

des(ω1)+des(ω4)=des(ω2)+des(ω3)

which holds just in case

des(ω1)des(ω2)=des(ω3)des(ω4)

Since it is assumed that des represents the subject’s utilities, it follows that the difference in utility between ω1 and ω2 is equal to that between ω3 and ω4 when the subject is indifferent between the gambles ‘ω1 if p, ω4 otherwise’ and ‘ω2 if p, ω3 otherwise’, for some ethically neutral proposition p of probability half.

Copyright © 2023 by
Fraser MacBride <fraser.macbride@manchester.ac.uk>
Mathieu Marion <marion.mathieu@uqam.ca>
María José Frápolli <frapolli@ugr.es>
Dorothy Edgington <d.edgington@bbk.ac.uk>
Edward Elliott <e.j.r.elliott@leeds.ac.uk>
Sebastian Lutz <sebastian.lutz@gmx.net>
Jeffrey Paris

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