Notes to The Unity of Science

1. The chief North American delegate was Paul Carus, editor of Open Court and The Monist.

2. While Morrison refers to unifying and explanatory mechanisms as formal representations involving interaction or connection parameters, she does not think of them as being mechanistic. The causal mechanisms behind those “mechanisms” are, for her, the real source of explanatory understanding. Much of the confusion comes from the ambiguity in her use of the term “mechanism”.

3. Plutynski and Rosenberg have stressed the value of answers to how-possibly and why-necessarily questions (the distinction corresponds to Maxwell’s distinction between illustration and explanation).

4. Contrast with Cartwright's antirealism in Cartwright 1983 about the universal fundamental level, on account of the local validity of empirical evidence and the approximation and idealizations that pave its twisted way to high-theory.

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Jordi Cat <jcat@indiana.edu>

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