THE BALLAD OF ST. ANSELM

Once a jolly friar got himself an argument
And couldn’t get it out of his mind.
He thought that he could prove the existence of the Deity
Because of the way that the words are defined.

CHORUS

Thus spake St. Anselm, thus spake St. Anselm,
Thus spake St. Anselm, who now is long dead,
And we’re awed as we read his proof so ontological;
Who can deny a word that he said?

If that than which nothing greater can be conceived
Can be conceived not to exist,
Then ’tis not that than which nothing greater can be conceived:
This is unquestionable, I insist.

For in that case a being greater can be conceived,
Whose major traits we can easily list:
Namely, that than which nothing greater can be conceived
And which cannot be conceived not to exist.

For if that than which nothing greater can be conceived
Has no existence outside of man’s mind,
Then ’tis not that than which nothing greater can be conceived,
Due to the way that the words are defined.

For in that case a greater can be conceived
(This is of course analytically true);
Namely, that than which nothing greater can be conceived
And which exists in reality too!

CHORUS

Thus spake St. Anselm, thus spake St. Anselm,
Thus spake St. Anselm with weighty intent,
And we’re awed as we read his proof so ontological
Would that we could understand what it meant.

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Last modified: April 9, 1996