Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy
Supplement to Actualism
New Actualism and Iterated Modalities
To see that iterated modalities pose no problem for new actualism,
recall first that the sentences
| (7) |
The pope (i.e., Karol Wojtyla) could have had a son who could
have become a priest. |
| (8) |
There could be a planet disturbing the orbit of
planet Y and it could have a period of Z years. |
can be represented as follows:
| (9) |
  x(Sxp
&Px) |
| (10) |
x(Dxy
& Pxz) |
These have straightforward actualist truth conditions requiring no
possibilia. For consider (9). The thing x which might have
been both the pope’s son and possibly a priest is a contingently
nonconcrete object that at some other world is the pope’s son and at
yet another world is a priest.
Copyright © 2000 by
Christopher Menzel
cmenzel@tamu.edu
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First published: June 16, 2000
Content last modified: June 16, 2000