Proof of Proposition 2.14: Supplement to Common Knowledge (Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy/Summer 2002 Edition)

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Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy
Supplement to Common Knowledge

Proof of Proposition 2.14

Proposition 2.14.
Let C^*_N be the greatest fixed point of f_E. Then C^*_N(E) = K^*_N(E).

Proof.

We have shown that K^*_N(E) is a fixed point of f_E, so we only need to show that K^*_N(E) is the greatest fixed point. Let B be a fixed point of f_B. We want to show that B subset K^k_N(E) for each value k equal to or greater than 1. We will proceed by induction on k. By hypothesis,

B = f_E(B) = K¹_N(E intersect

K¹_N(E) by monotonicity, so we have the k=1 case. Now suppose that for k=m, B subset

K^m_N(E). Then by monotonicity,

(i) K¹_N(B) K¹_NK^m_N(E) = K^m+1_N(E)

We alo have:

(ii) B = K¹_N(EB) K¹_N(B)

by monotonicity, so combining (i) and (ii) we have:

B K¹_N(B) K^m+1_N(E)

completing the induction. QED

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First published: June 12, 2002
Content last modified: June 12, 2002

Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy Supplement to Common Knowledge

Proof of Proposition 2.14

Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy
Supplement to Common Knowledge