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LORD D. RENE BROCHARD,
LORD OF THE FOUNTAINS, ETC. A DEFENSE
AT THE POITIERS SENATE HOUSE WITH ALL THE SENATE,
HIS UNCLE IN SPECIAL ATTENDANCE.
Rene Descartes: Canon and Civil Law License [I.V.Q.], Gives salutations and peace [S.P.D.]
--It pleases one to approach the pure fountains, and to drink, and to gather new flowers.
Indeed, in taking refuge in you (my uncle, having seen much) I think that I have reached the pleasant fountain of integrity itself. Not only will I be adorned with the glorious fragrance of your flowers--Thus I do nothing to bring about my coming glory--but also my adolescence, still fresh and green, irrigated by your fountain of sweetest virtue, will blossom hereafter, and I cannot despair. Indeed, just as the gentle meadows whose foliage is drenched with water, on which a more variegated beauty of flowers is heaped, certainly human nature will the more flourish which drinks the sweet drink of knowledge and virtue.
I thought that while even a tender sprout that I was especially inquisitive, for while nearly all the youngsters cried as they departed their youth, I was devoted to the fountains, the wet milk of my step-mother--the nectar of the liberal arts--dripping from my lips. At first in fact, I, wonderfully delighted, muttered a noisy stream of flattery, strongly desiring to drink the stuff of the honey-flowing poet. But soon, my admiration for their heavy clamor and voices produced in me a torrent of images in which I took refuge, in turn hiding from me the eloquent waters for which I had [originally] thirsted. And, not only did these things produce in me more of a thirst for knowledge than they could quench, but none of them ever really satisfied me.
The [resulting] desolation of knowledge eventually leveled me, and I, at that point, began to search with great zeal for any streams that were more abundant than this other, and that flowed [perhaps even] in a different direction. [At first I thought that] carrying out something so ambitious was certainly not insane, since I did not think that such an undertaking would wear me down, or judge that a single petty stream would wear me out. My hope was that I could root out some [of the streams] from the rest, the sweet drops of the former at last calming my nature. And, my hope was that all would be distinguished by way of [proof of] experience.
[I did not realize, however, how much] my ever so laborious inquisitiveness had worn me out until I had arrived at a [certain] place and had learned of pure virtue, having seen it gushing from the fountain. And, ever since then I disliked these other [streams], and I began to value and follow only that [stream] of yours, [Uncle], this (and not my speech that now advances us as if through a thick fog) I propose is the one thing itself from all others that I now admire and imitate. For great is the purity or your life, great the integrity of [your] character, great the sweetness of [your] social intercourse, great the abundance of [your] teaching, great the strength of [your] virtue: as nothing more of this most pleasant fountain can be longed for but to be filled up [by it].
For what? In order to gently make a noise--For am I not turned awry as it works, the speeding water that hurries along with the river? Certainly with respect to your fountains of virtue, the greatest gratitude overflows with the roar of public opinion, [and even] the minds of the envious allow it to be thought. Not only have these distinguished things so greatly attracted me, but the abundant surge [of water] is [surely] pure silver, and the richness of the sandy banks brilliant gold.
It is thus that my Maiden appears to be the most beautiful, not Artemis, who Actaeon saw naked, but Themis, who has by way of truly unequal straightforward reason changed me, not into a wild stag, where following I [like Acteaon] quickly avoid appearing visibly fearful. [Rather,] she tames through freedom the wildness implanted previously in the brute, without interruption, and at this the appropriate time has excited [in me] the desire to pursue my own life. And, since indeed it is not unfit for me to desire to testify concerning my lover and sustainer, [and that] you are not undeserving of that which is in the pure fountains--it residing as though in your sacred place--it is now especially pleasing [for us] to gather, and it is even more lovely to bring about your deeming worthy for the Goddess [her] favor and for me [my] kindness.
Descartes’ 1616 Law Thesis -- Latin Translation
Return to Supplementary Document: Descartes’s Law Thesis
First published: January 2, 2002
Content last modified: January 2, 2002