A Proof Concerning Bradwardine’s Theory

Here is a proof that on Bradwardine’s theory, every proposition signifies that it is true. Let ‘P’ name the proposition replacing ’p.’ Then:

1.	p		Assume for conditional proof.
2.	P signifies that q		Assume for conditional proof.
3.	p q		From 2 and the thesis that what propositions signify follows from them.
4.	q		From 1, 3, and modus ponens
5.	(P signifies that q) q		From 2-4, by conditional proof.
6.	P is true.		From 5 and Bradwardine’s definition of truth, since 5 is general with respect to propositions replacing ‘q’.
7.	p P is true		From 1-6, by conditional proof.
8.	P signifies that P is true.		From 7 and "Bradwardine’s Principle."

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First published: August 27, 2001
Content last modified: August 27, 2001