Derivation of STAT FUNC: A Supplement to The Kochen-Specker Theorem (Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy/Summer 2002 Edition)

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Derivation of STAT FUNC

The result is proved for a pure state and a non-degenerate discrete observable A with eigenvalues a_i.

We first rewrite the statistical algorithm for projection operators:

(1)

For an arbitrary function f: R maps into

R (where R is the set of real numbers) we define the function of an observable A as:

Moreover, we introduce the characteristic function of a number a as:

As a result, we can rewrite a project operator as:

(2)

and thus the statistical algorithm as:

We also use a simple mathematical property of characteristic functions:

whence we can also write:

(3)

Then:

Hence:

Now since

First posted: September 10, 2000
Last modified: September 10, 2000