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John Philoponus
John Philoponus, a Christian philosopher, scientist, and theologian
who lived approximately from 490 to 570, is also known as John the
Grammarian or John of Alexandria. The epithet ‘Philoponus’
means literally ‘Lover of toil’. Philoponus' life and
work are closely connected to the city of Alexandria and the
Alexandrian Neoplatonic school. Although the Aristotelian-Neoplatonic
tradition was the source of his intellectual roots and concerns, he
was an original thinker who eventually broke with that tradition in
many important respects, both substantive and methodological, and
cleared part of the way which led to more critical and empirical
approaches in the natural sciences. Which intellectual, religious, or
other cultural circumstances of his life and times may have put
Philoponus into the position to initiate and foreshadow the eventual
demise of Aristotelianism is one of the most fascinating questions
anyone who tries to arrive at a fuller appreciation of the work of
this important late Greek philosopher faces.
Philoponus' oeuvre comprises at least 40 items on diverse
subjects such as grammar, logic, mathematics, physics, psychology,
cosmology, astronomy, theology and church politics; even medical
treatises have been attributed to him. A substantial part of his work
has come down to us, but some treatises are known only indirectly
through quotations or translations into Syriac and Arabic. Although
his fame rests predominantly on the fact that, even within some of his
commentaries on works of Aristotle, he initiated and in fact
anticipated the eventual liberation of natural philosophy from the
straitjacket of Aristotelianism, his non-polemical commentaries on
Aristotle as well as his theological treatises deserve to be
appreciated as well.
Philoponus' intellectual career began when he was a pupil of the
Neoplatonic philosopher Ammonius, son of Hermias, who had been taught
by Proclus at Athens and was head of the school at Alexandria. Some of
his commentaries profess to be based on Ammonius' lectures, but
others give more room to Philoponus' own ideas. Eventually, he
transformed the usual format of apologetic commentary into a discourse
of open criticism, in the course of which he examined and repudiated
fundamental Aristotelian-Neoplatonic tenets, most prominently the
doctrine of the eternity of the world. This independent-minded or even
disrespectful approach to philosophical commentary, as well as the
conclusions he drew, antagonized Philoponus' pagan colleagues;
their opposition may have compelled him to abandon his philosophical
career in the 530's. Philoponus never succeeded his teacher
Ammonius as head of the school. He devoted the second half of his life
to engaging in the theological debates of his time. Ironically, the
orthodox church condemned him posthumously as a heretic (in 680-81)
because of his tritheistic interpretation of the trinitarian dogma:
through a reading of the relevant concepts in this debate (nature,
substance, hupostasis) in a strictly Aristotelian way, Philoponus was
led to enunciate not a single god in three persons (Father, Son,
Spirit), but three separate divinities.
Reading Philoponus as well as the writings of his great adversary
Simplicius, one gets the sense that in the 6th century CE, traditional
pagan Greek learning had become desperately insular. The intense
incompatibilities between pagan learning and Christian dogma are
readily visible on the philosophical surface of Philoponus' work
as he struggles to hold his faith accountable to reason. Although his
mode of thinking betrays a strong Aristotelian influence, it also
displays a certain doctrinal affinity to Plato stripped of the weighty
accretions of Neoplatonic interpretation. The style of
Philoponus' writing is often circuitous and rarely entertaining,
displaying at times an almost pedantic rigor of argument and
exposition. Yet he complements this with a remarkable freedom of
spirit, which in turn allows him to cast off the fetters of authority
as a criterion of truth, be it philosophical or
theological. Philoponus' works were translated into Arabic, Latin
and Syriac, and he influenced later thinkers such as Bonaventure,
Gersonides, Buridan, Oresme and Galileo.
The Grammarian's early extant work on ambiguous words in Greek
distinguishable only by their accent is philosophically
insignificant. I pass on to give an impression of his extant
philosophical writings, first and foremost his commentaries on
Aristotle. In order to appreciate the magnitude of Philoponus'
achievement as philosopher and scientist, one has to take into
account, at least partially, the intellectual culture in which he was
brought up. A common way that philosophers in late antiquity developed
and propagated their own ideas was by composing commentaries on the
classical philosophical texts of Plato and Aristotle. Generations of
such commentaries were written from the time when Aristotle's works
were again made accessible to a wider audience in the first century
BCE down to the seventh century and beyond, forming a massive
tradition. However, the majority of ancient commentaries still extant
were written by Neoplatonists as textbooks for their philosophical
courses. Typically, these works have a number of features in common:
- The commentaries consisted in an extremely detailed oral exegesis
of a philosophical text, designed for the benefit of students.
- Not uncommonly, selected pupils were responsible for taking
verbatim notes of their teachers' exegeses, thus turning the
lecture into a book roll.
- Each set of lectures and resulting commentary constituted a step
within a substantial curriculum of philosophical training which began
with Aristotle and aimed at progressing towards Plato.
- A commentator was expected to demonstrate the agreement between
Plato and Aristotle, indeed, to show forth the harmony among all
“ancient” philosophers (i.e., those down to the time of
Aristotle) including Homer.
- Finally, doing philosophy in this way was not only an education,
it was also and even more so a pagan religious exercise, empowering
human beings to perfect their intellect and their character with a
view to becoming godlike as far as is humanly possible.
After a basic education in “grammar” as well as studies in
classical Greek language and literature, John Philoponus, who was
probably born into a Christian family, embarked on this curriculum
(c. 510). As a pupil of Ammonius (c. 440-520) he assumed
responsibility for writing down the lectures of the school's
ailing head: the commentaries on Aristotle's On Generation
and Corruption, On the Soul, Prior Analytics
and Posterior Analytics explicitly state in their titles that
they are based on Ammonius' seminars (ek tôn
synousiôn Ammôníou). The commentaries on the
Categories, Physics and Meteorology do not
make such claims, which suggests, in conjunction with other evidence,
that Philoponus was teaching these courses himself. He presumably
took over as lecturer from Ammonius at some point, although he never
held the chair of philosophy but remained
‘grammatikós’, professor of philology.
After the death of Ammonius the school's leadership seems to have
passed into the hands of the mathematician Eutocius and then on to the
philosopher Olympiodorus (c. 495-570), who was a pagan and still
taught in Alexandria in the year 565.
In many ways, Philoponus' commentary on the Categories
may be regarded as typical of its kind. The exegesis of
Aristotle's text is prefaced by a general clarification of
matters of interest for the student who reads philosophy for the first
time. (Similar introductions can also be found as prefaces to
commentaries on Porphyry's Introduction.) Aristotle's
logical works were arranged in an order of increasing complexity,
beginning with the Categories, which deals with simple,
uncombined utterances. This was followed by De
interpretatione (on propositions), Prior Analytics (on
syllogism) and Posterior Analytics (on proof). Discussing the
problem of the subject matter (skopós) of the
Categories, Philoponus says -- roughly in agreement with
Iamblichus -- that the Categories are about simple utterances
(phônaí) signifying simple things
(prágmata) by means of simple concepts
(noêmata; In Cat. 10).
Most Neoplatonists followed Alexander of Aphrodisias in regarding
logic not as a separate philosophical discipline (the Stoic view) but
rather as philosophy's tool, its organon. In their
commentaries on the Prior Analytics, both Philoponus and
Ammonius side with that tradition and reject the Stoic view, but they
add that in the case of Plato, dialectic may well be regarded as part
of Platonic philosophy (witness dialogues such as Phaedrus
and Phaedo) as well as an excercise in its own right serving
as philosophical tool (witness the Parmenides;
cf. Philoponus, In An.Pr. 6-9). The contemporary Athenian Neoplatonist
Simplicius, who spent much acumen on repudiating and excoriating
Philoponian cosmological ideas, denied Philoponus' competence as
a logician, and modern scholars tend to agree with him. Historians of
logic, however, acknowledge that Philoponus was the first to render a
satisfactory account of the syllogism (subsequently the traditional
one), stating that the major premise includes the predicate term of
the conclusion, the minor premise the subject term (In
An.Pr. 67). In Philoponus, too, one encounters for the first time
a particular diagram which schematised what kind of conclusions
(i.e. universal affirmative, universal negative, particular
affirmative, or particular negative) follow from what kind of
premises. This diagram, later to be called by the schoolmen
‘ass's bridge’ (pons asinorum), enabled
students of logic more easily to construct valid syllogisms (In
An.Pr. 274).
The commentary on Aristotle's On the Soul is perhaps the
earliest to contain passages in which Philoponus abandons at times
proper exegesis in order to criticize Aristotelian doctrine, a
tendency which is even more conspicuous in the Physics
commentary, dated to 517. Scholars now believe that at least some of
these deviations from commentary proper derive from a later revision
of the original exegesis. One can distinguish between two kinds of
criticism: substantial modification of Aristotelian ideas on the one
hand, and outright rejection on the other. Philoponus' commentary
On the Soul presents a good example of the former kind of
criticism. In On the Soul II 7 Aristotle takes light to be
incorporeal, and he describes its appearance as an instantaneous
transition from the potentiality (dúnamis) of a medium
to be everywhere transparent to the actuality
(enérgeia) of transparency. At pp. 330ff of
Philoponus' commentary he offers a construcive kind of criticism
which seems to have had momentous consequences for his eventual
conceptualization of the theory of the impetus (see below). Philoponus
contends that Aristotle' view fails to account both for the laws
of optics and for the plain phenomenon that the region below the moon
is warmed by the light of the sun, a celestial body. In an
Aristotelian spirit of modifying the theory so as to save the
phenomena, he proceeds to re-interpret the term
enérgeia not as a state of actuality, but rather as an
‘incorporeal activity’ which, besides constituting the
transparency of the medium, is also capable of warming bodies. In the
same way, Philoponus argues, soul, as an incorporeal activity in the
body, causes the animal to be warm. Due to this novel interpretation
of Aristotle's terminology, light is now understood not
statically but as something dynamical. And it is possible to trace
Philoponus' further development of the idea. In the
Meteorology commentary, which belongs to a stage when
Philoponus had abandoned the Aristotelian assumption of an immutable
celestial fifth element (ether), he argues that light and heat may
best be explained as consequences of the nature of the sun, which is
fire (In Meteor. 49). Heat is generated when the rays
emanating from the sun are refracted and warm the air through
friction.
The Physics commentary contains an array of examples of
innovative and damagingly critical commentary. One of the most
celebrated achievements is the theory of impetus, which is commonly
regarded as a decisive step away from an Aristotelian dynamics towards
a modern theory based on the notion of inertia. Concepts akin to those
deployed in Philoponus' impetus theory appear in earlier writers
such as Hipparchus (2nd c. BCE) and Synesius (4th c. CE), but
Philoponus nowhere intimates that he was influenced by any one of
them. As far as one can tell from the text In Phys. 639-42,
he takes his point of departure from an unsatisfactory Aristotelian
answer to a problem that was to puzzle scientists for centuries: Why
does an arrow continue to fly after it has left the bow-string, or a
stone after it has ceased to be in contact with the hand that throws
it? Since Aristotle supposed that a) whenever there is motion there
must be something which imparts the motion, and b) mover and moved
must be in contact, he was led to conclude that the air displaced in
front of the projectile somehow rushes round it and pushes from
behind, thus propelling the projectile along. This theory was still in
vogue among Aristotelians of the sixteenth century, despite the fact
that a thousand years earlier Philoponus had had no truck with it. He
proposed instead, much more plausibly but still erroneously, that a
projectile moves on account of a kinetic force which is impressed on
it by the mover and which exhausts itself in the course of the
movement. Philoponus compares this impetus or ‘incorporeal
motive enérgeia’, as he calls it, to the activity
earlier attributed to light.
Once projectile motion was understood in terms of an impetus in this
way, it became possible for Philoponus to reassess the rôle of
the medium: far from being responsible for the continuation of a
projectile's motion it is in fact an impediment to it (In
Phys. 681). On this basis Philoponus concludes, against
Aristotle, that there is in fact nothing to prevent one from imagining
motion taking place through a void. As regards the natural motion of
bodies falling through a medium, Aristotle's verdict that the
speed is proportional to the weight of the moving bodies and
indirectly proportional to the density of the medium is disproved by
Philoponus through appeal to the same kind of experiment that Galileo
was to carry out centuries later (In Phys. 682-84).
Philoponus' impetus theory ties in with other far-reaching
criticisms of Aristotelian principles of physics. Aristotle had
dismissed the notion of a void as incoherent as a logical
impossibility. Philoponus concedes that in nature empty spaces never
become actual, but he insists that a clear conception of the void is
not only coherent but also necessary if one wants to explain movement
in a plenum. When bodies move and in consequence exchange places, this
presupposes that somehow there is empty space available to be filled
by them (In Phys. 693f.). Again, there are certain phenomena
which clearly exhibit the force of the vacuum, for example handling a
pipette (clepsudra), which allows one to raise small
quantities of fluids, or the fact that one can suck up water through a
pipe (In Phys. 571f). Philoponus' elaborate defense of
the void (In Phys. 675-94) is closely related to his
conceptions of place and space (In Phys. 557-85). Aristotle
defined the place of a body as the inner surface of the body or all
the bodies taken together that contain it (Phys. IV 4);
Philoponus replies that place ought to be conceived as the
three-dimensional extension identical to the determinate size of the
body, i.e. its volume. This was also the theory of the Stoic
Chrysippus, but there is no indication in the present text of
Philoponus (as there are in his later works) that he saw himself
influenced by the Stoics.
Like place, space is indeterminate three-dimensional extension devoid
of body, though it is not actually infinite -- so much Philoponus
concedes to Aristotle. Philoponus' discussion of matter builds
upon this conception of space. In the Physics commentary
(687f.) he argues in a similar vein to Aristotle in
Metaphysics VII 3: In abstracting all qualities and other
determinations from body Aristotle arrived at a conception of
characterless, undetermined matter, a “prime matter” that
the Neoplatonists later defined as formless and incorporeal (because
it was no actual body, but only the necessary underlying condition
for bodies). Philoponus, in contrast, arrives at something
he calls corporeal extension (sômatikón
diástêma), which is a composite of Neoplatonic prime
matter and indeterminate quantity and must not be confused with
Philoponian space. His argument here may still be regarded as an
elaboration on or correction of Aristotle. However, in Book XI of the
polemical treatise against Proclus (see below, 3.1) he jettisons the
Aristotelian-Neoplatonic conception of prime matter and posits as the
most fundamental level of his ontology ‘the
three-dimensional’, as he calls it, i.e. indeterminately extended
mass. In this he claims to be following the Stoics (Aet.
414), and it has been pointed out that this ontological level is
reminiscent to us of the Cartesian res extensa, although
Descartes would not allow Philoponus' distinction between space
and corporeal extension. In order to rebuff the likely objection that
the three-dimensional cannot be the most fundamental level of being
because extension, belonging to the Aristotelian category of quantity,
is an accident and requires the assumption of a distinct underlying
subject, Philoponus argues that extension is in fact not an accident,
but an essential and inseparable differentia of ‘the
three-dimensional’, just like heat in fire or whiteness in
snow. Thus quantity (corporeal extension) is constitutive of body as
such. This amounts to a promotion of one sort of quantity to the
category of substance. There are indications that Philoponus would
accordingly have modified Aristotle's scheme of the
Categories if he had revised his early commentary on that
treatise.
The incomplete commentary on the Meteorology may well be the
last commentary Philoponus wrote on Aristotle. It is instructive to
notice how the lectures are presented with an air of aloofness and, at
times, deliberate vagueness. In several places, especially when he
has to comment on the nature and movement of the heavens, Philoponus
breaks off and refers the student to previously published work: what
Philoponus really has to say about the text seems no longer
appropriate for the traditionally conceived class-room. He has shaken
off the weight of Aristotle's or anyone else's authority,
and far from attempting to demonstrate the harmony among philosophers
he puts himself forward as a philosopher who dissents from the
recognized philosophical authority. The commentator has turned into a
critic with independent philosophical ideas of his own.
The Athenian Neoplatonist Proclus (c. 411-485), Philoponus'
teacher and Ammonius' teacher, had written a defense of the pagan
Greek (Aristotelian, Platonist) belief in the eternity of the
world. His aim was to show that Christian creationism was
intellectually untenable. Proclus' eighteen arguments took their
point of departure from the myth of Plato's Timaeus,
which, according to Proclus, was best and most consistently
interpreted according to an eternalist reading: the surface talk of a
world being constructed by a divine ‘demiurge’ is part of the
mythical framework, not a literal, philosophical claim.
In 529, the year when emperor Justinian put an end to pagan
philosophical teaching in Athens, Philoponus published a reply
entitled On the Eternity of the World against Proclus. The
book amounts to an anti-commentary on the Proclean arguments: combing
through Proclus' text Philoponus literally repudiates every
single point made. Although his efforts are evidently to some extent
motivated by his Christian faith, he keeps biblical theology out of
his polemic, attempting to refute Proclus within the framework of
Platonist philosophy. He reads the Timaeus as a genuine
account of creation (Book VI), compatibly with Christian doctrine. A
fresh analysis of the processes of generation and corruption renders
even an idea viable which Greek philosophers of all schools never
allowed: creation out of nothing (Books VIII and IX). Yet even if it
were true that creation out of nothing never occurs in nature, God is
surely more powerful a creator than nature and therefore capable of
creatio ex nihilo (IX 9).
Philoponus' battle against eternalism may be divided into three
stages. The treatise Against Proclus is followed by a second
and even more provocative publication, On the Eternity of the
World against Aristotle. This work was published c. 530-534 and
involved a close scrutiny of the first chapters of Aristotle's
On the Heavens (his theory of ether as the fifth element, of
which the heavenly bodies are made) and the eighth book of the
Physics (arguing for the eternity of time and motion). The
third stage is represented by one, perhaps two, non-polemical
treatises that have survived in fragments which indicate that numerous
arguments against eternity and for creation were arranged in some kind
of systematic order.
Like the polemic against Proclus, Against Aristotle is
mainly devoted to removing obstacles for the creationist. If Aristotle
were right about the existence of an immutable fifth element (ether)
in the celestial region, and if he were right about motion and time
being eternal, any belief in creation would surely be
unwarranted. Philoponus succeeds in pointing to numerous
contradictions, inconsistencies, fallacies and improbable assumptions
in Aristotle's philosophy of nature relating to these
claims. Dissecting Aristotle's texts in an unprecedented way, he
time and again turns the tables on Aristotle and so paves the way for
demonstrative arguments for non-eternity. One such argument is
reported by Simplicius (In Phys. 1178,7-1179,26 = Contra
Aristotelem, Fr. 132). It relies on three premises: (1) If the
existence of something requires the preexistence of something else,
then the first thing will not come to be without the prior existence
of the second. (2) An infinite number cannot exist in actuality, nor
be traversed in counting, nor be increased. (3) Something cannot come
into being if its existence requires the preexistence of an infinite
number of other things, one arising out of the other. From these not
at all un-Aristotelian premises Philoponus deduces that the conception
of a temporally infinite universe, understood as a successive causal
chain, is impossible. The celestial spheres of Aristotelian theory
have different periods of revolution, and in any given number of years
they undergo different numbers of revolutions, some larger than
others. The assumption of their motion having gone on for all eternity
leads to the conclusion that infinity can be increased, even
multiplied, which Aristotle too held to be absurd.
The non-polemical anti-eternalist treatises exploit, among others,
Aristotle's argument that an infinite power or potentiality
(dúnamis) cannot reside in a finite body
(Phys. VIII 10). Philoponus infers that since the universe is
a finite body, it cannot have the dúnamis to exist for
an infinite time. As in the case of his theory of light, this argument
involves a shift of meaning. In the context of Aristotle's
argument in Phys. VIII 10, dúnamis meant
‘kinetic force’; Philoponus uses the word in the sense of
‘existential capacity’ or ‘fitness to exist’.
By the end of the 530s Philoponus seems to have stopped producing
philosophical works; his career as a philosopher was
finished. Thenceforward his writing was devoted to theological
topics. Since there is no evidence that he belonged to the clerical
order, it is difficult to picture his professional life as a
theologian. He published his theological treatises under the same name
by which he had established himself, Iôánnês ho
Grammatikós, yet it seems hard to imagine him still as a
professor of Grammar. His other epithet
‘philóponos’ (lover of toil) is probably
best interpreted as an acknowledgment of his literary productivity,
not as an indication that he was one of those zealous Christian
brethren in Egypt who called themselves by that name.
Perhaps some fifteen years (the date is disputed) after his attack on
Aristotle on the eternity of the world, Philoponus published a
commentary on the biblical creation story, On the Creation of the
World (De opificio mundi), which is his only theological
work extant in Greek. While discussing the biblical text Philoponus
frequently refers to philosophers like Aristotle, Plato and Ptolemy as
well as to St. Basil the Great, whose own treatise on the creation
served him as inspiration. The De opificio mundi has received
some attention from historians of science, because Philoponus suggests
at one point (I 12) that the movement of the heavens could be
explained by a ‘motive force’ impressed on the celestial
bodies by God at the time of creation. As we have seen (2.2 above),
Philoponus discussed impetus theory for the first time in the context
of forced motion, as when one shoots an arrow with a bow; now he
applies the theory to the regular and natural motions of the universe
at large. Significantly, Philoponus compares the rotation implanted in
the celestial bodies to the rectilinear movements of the elements as
well as to the movements of animals: curiously, these are all
understood as natural motions that are due to the creator's
divine impetus. In virtue of this bold suggestion Philoponus is often
credited with having envisaged, for the first time, a unified theory
of dynamics, since he strove to give the same kind of explanation for
phenomena which Aristotle had to explain by different principles,
depending upon their different cosmological contexts.
Judging from the fragmentary evidence, Philoponus' later
theological treatises were characterized by a curious mixture of
Christian doctrine and Aristotelian philosophy. On the eve of the
fifth Council (Constantinople, 553) Philoponus stepped forward as a
partisan of monophysite Christology which, in the course of the
century, had become increasingly influential in the eastern part of
the Roman empire. The monophysites, who were bent on emphasizing the
divinity of Christ, were scandalized by the conjunction of
Christological formulae enuntiated at the Council of Chalcedon in
451. There Christ was confessed to be (1) consubstantial
(homooúsios) with the Father, (2) consubstantial with
us humans, (3) one person and one hypóstasis (an
important term widespread in Neoplatonism and roughly meaning
‘substantive existence’), but (4) discernible in two natures
(en dúo phúsesin
gnôrizómenon), a phrase which was directly
influenced by the ‘unitatem personae in utraque natura
intelligendam’ (‘a unity of person knowable in both
natures’) endorsed by the Bishop of Rome and familiar to
theologians of the Latin West. Although propositions 1, 2 and 3 were
no longer controversial, proposition 4 could be read as an unholy
concession to those who regarded Jesus as a human being merely
distinguished by some kind of divine presence or inspiration (the view
of the so-called ‘dyophysites’).
In Arbiter (Arbitrator or Umpire) of about
the same time (surviving only in Syriac translation) Philoponus takes
the view that the locution ‘discernible in two natures’
ought to be abandoned. His main strategy is to argue that in this
context the meaning of the terms ‘nature’ and
‘hypóstasis’ is virtually identical, so that
if Christ is (according to (3)) one hypóstasis he
cannot also (as in (4)) be discernible in two natures. The
argument goes roughly as follows: The term ‘nature’ has two
applications, one general and one particular: we can speak of the
nature of man in general or of the particular nature of this
individual man. Now, when one speaks of the unification (and
discerniblitiy) of two natures in Christ, this cannot be meant to say
that the universal natures of godhead and manhood have been unified in
Christ (else it would be also true to say that not only the Logos, but
also the Father and the Spirit have become man, since the universal
nature of godhead applies to them as much as it does to the
Logos). Instead, the reference must be to the particular nature of the
divine Logos and the particular nature of Jesus the man: it must be
with reference to these particular natures that godhead and manhood
are combined in Christ. But this too cannot be right, Philoponus
argues, since ‘particular nature’ means the same as
‘hypóstasis’, which he uses as a synonym also of
‘person’ and ‘individual being’. Since it is
agreed that Christ is one person and one hypóstasis,
he must consequently also be of one ‘particular’ nature
only, not two. Philoponus concedes, of course, that the nature of
Christ is not an ordinary one; it is complex, combining and preserving
the properties of both what it is to be a god and what it is to be a
man. Far from being able to discern two different natures in Christ,
we should speak of one complex nature (mía phúsis
súnthetos).
Besides monophysitism, Philoponus' name is associated with the
doctrine of tritheism. However, one needs to be aware of an important
difference: Whereas monophysitism was a reputable and powerful
theological movement in the Eastern church, tritheism was little more
than a hostile label given to certain intellectuals who tried to make
the mystery of the Trinity intelligible in philosophical
language. Philoponus was one such intellectual who, again, resorted to
Aristotelian terminology to clarify and settle the trinitarian
dispute. Already in the Arbiter it was clear that Philoponus
tended to understand the crucial term
‘hypóstasis’ as meaning something like
‘primary substance’ in the sense of Aristotle's
Categories, i.e. an individual organic being. The fragments
of the very late treatise On the Trinity confirm this. Since
hypóstasis is certainly not an accident of divinity,
Philoponus argues, it must be the case that the three
hypostáseis of the Trinity are three particular divine
substances with distinct properties. Only on this assumption, too, is
it reasonable to speak of the consubstantiality of the three Persons,
for if there were only one divine substance, what sense would it make
to speak of consubstantiality at all? When Basil and Gregory of Nyssa
spoke of the Trinity as ‘one ousía, three
hypostáseis,’ they were not, Philoponus
continues, enunciating four primary substances, but used
‘substance’ (ousía) in the secondary,
abstract sense of essence or universal nature. In accordance with
Aristotle, Philoponus claims that universals exist only in the
mind. Thus, the claim that there is only one God appears to be true of
the unity constituted by the concept of divinity. In actual
fact, there are three separate divinites, Father, Son, and Spirit. In
order to fend off any reminiscences of pagan polytheism, Philoponus
points out that unlike the individually differentiated gods of the
pagans the three divinities of the Trinity are all of the same, single
divine nature in the universal sense of ‘nature’. Though
Philoponus had his followers, trinitarian philosophy of this kind
could hardly be palatable to anyone not committed before all else to
Aristotle's ontology. The so-called tritheists faced immediate and
severe criticism, and Philoponus himself was condemned by the Council
of Constantinople of 680-81.
Nowadys, Philoponus is often celebrated for having been one of the
first thinkers to reconcile Aristotelian philosophy with
Christianity. To some extent, this is true, but crucially, his
contemporaries must have taken a different view. Pagan philosophers
abhorred the way in which Philoponus used Christianity as a vantage
point from which, in their opinion, he recklessly disturbed the
harmony of the Greek philosophers, and Christian theologians could not
but castigate his attempt to comprehend in Aristotelian terms what was
for them essentially a spiritual mystery.
Despite arousing the disapproval of many of his contemporaries, both
pagan and Christian, Philoponus' immediate influence may have
been considerable among fellow-monophysites in Egypt. The anathema of
681, however, made the further proliferation of his theological ideas
impossible. Likewise, his arch-enemy Simplicius, also a pupil of
Ammonius, submitted the Grammarian's anti-eternalism almost
immediately to thundering pro-Aristotelian criticism (in his
commentaries on the De Caelo and the Physics,
written sometime in the late 530s). It was that polemic which
resounded through the ages, to the effect that later thinkers like
Thomas Aquinas (1224-1274) and Zabarella (1533-1589) underestimated
Philoponus altogether. Although Philoponus' work was studied by
the Arabs, who referred to him as Yahyâ an-Nahwî or
Yahyâ al-‘Asqalânî, they too tended to side
with Simplicius and Aristotle. However, the arguments against eternity
eventually persuaded Bonaventure (1217-1274) and Gersonides
(1288-1344), and impetus theory was reaffirmed by Buridan (1295-1356)
and his pupil Oresme (1325-1382). In the sixteenth century, the first
editions and numerous translations (into Latin) of Philoponus'
commentaries and the treatise Against Proclus began to appear
in print. Eventually, Philoponus' criticism of Aristotelian
dynamics in the Physics commentary was widely discussed and
persuaded such diverse thinkers as Gianfrancesco Pico della Mirandola
(1469-1533) and, for different reasons, Galileo Galilei (1564-1642).
The greatest challenge for a student of this period of the history of
philosophy is to understand how a phenomenon such as Philoponus could
have happened. To be sure, elusive individual qualities of his mind
and personality must have played an essential rôle, but it is
equally true that philosophical, social, and religious parameters are
likely to have supplied conditions which allowed him to carry forward
his unprecedented and unparalleled act of emancipation from a widely
accepted intellectual tradition. In the past, scholars have
readily pointed towards the presumed fact that Philoponus was first
raised as a Christian who later came into privileged contact with
Greek rationalism; it is supposed that this constellation catalyzed
his stance of critical opposition and rejection. However, this
explanation is far from satisfactory. Many Christians from birth both
before and after Philoponus were similarly exposed to pagan philosophy
without reacting in a comparable way. Other scholars have suggested
that Philoponus may have received orders from clerical superiors to
write a refutation of Aristotelianism. Again others, especially with a
view to the invention of the theory of impetus, have sought the roots
of Philoponus' intellectual emancipation in broad socio-economic
changes which occurred in late antiquity, in particular the
emancipation of slaves. However this is eventually going to be
explained, it seems certain that what essentially enabled Philoponus
to operate both as a critic of Aristotelianism and as a constructive
thinker in his own right was somehow tied up with new understanding of
what one ought to do when one is reading and interpreting the
philosophical texts of Plato or Aristotle. Whereas Neoplatonists,
especially since Proclus (412-485), tended to approach these ancient
texts as a fabric of venerable signs pointing per se and in
an infallible way to a higher reality and to the truth, Philoponus
read them (as we do today) as indicators of the thoughts and
intentions of fallible authors. This more measured hermeneutic
approach allowed Philoponus to point out problematic tensions and
apparent contradictions in the Aristotelian corpus, or to highlight
significant instances of disagreement between Plato and Aristotle; in
contrast, the program of the Neoplatonic tradition he grew up in was
to ignore the problems, or explain them away.
| c.510-15 |
On words with different meanings in virtue of a difference of
accent (De vocabulis quae diversum significatum exhibent
secundum differentiam accentus), ed. L.W. Daly, American
Philosophical Society Memoirs 151, Philadelphia: American
Philosophical Society, 1983. |
| c.510-15 |
Commentary on Aristotle's ‘On Generation and
Corruption’, ed. H. Vitelli, Commentaria in Aristotelem
Graeca (henceforward CAG) XIV 2, Berlin: Reimer,
1897. (A commentary based on Ammonius' seminars containing
virtually no criticism of Aristotle.) |
| c.510-15 |
Commentary on Aristotle's ‘De Anima’
ed. M. Hayduck, CAG XV, Berlin: Reimer, 1897. (This work on
Aristotle's On the Soul contains rather mature
commentary; evidence suggests, however, that the work comes early in
Philoponus' career, and it therefore seems reasonable to assume
that the substance of the ideas expressed in it is by his teacher
Ammonius. In addition, the authenticity of the commentary's third
Book is disputed, because a Latin version attributed to Philoponus
differs from the text transmitted in Greek: see Jean Philopon,
Commentaire sur le de anima d'Aristote, traduction de Guillaume
de Moerbeke, ed. G. Verbeke, Corpus Latinum Commentariorum
in Aristotelem Graecorum III, Paris: Editions
Béatrice-Nauwelaerts, 1966. Trans. W. Charlton, Philoponus,
On Aristotle on the Intellect (de Anima 3.4-8), London:
Duckworth, 1991.) |
| c.512-17 |
Commentary on Aristotle's ‘Categories’,
ed. A. Busse, CAG XIII 1, Berlin: Reimer, 1898. |
| c.512-17 |
Commentary on Aristotle's ‘Prior
Analytics’, ed. M. Wallies, CAG XIII 2, Berlin:
Reimer, 1905. (The only complete extant ancient commentary on the
Prior Analytics. It purports to be based on Ammonius'
seminars.) |
| c.515-20 |
Commentary on Aristotle's ‘Posterior
Analytics’, ed. M. Wallies, CAG XIII 3, Berlin:
Reimer, 1909. (This commentary too professes to be based on Ammonius,
but there are signs of a later revision.) |
| 517 |
Commentary on Aristotle's ‘Physics’,
ed. H. Vitelli, CAG XVI-XVII, Berlin: Reimer,
1887?88. (Philoponus' most important commentary, in which he
challenges Aristotle's tenets on time, space, void, matter and
dynamics; there are clear signs of revision.) Trans. A.R. Lacey,
Philoponus, On Aristotle's Physics 2, London: Duckworth,
1993; M. Edwards, Philoponus, On Aristotle's Physics 3,
London: Duckworth, 1994; P. Lettinck, Philoponus, On
Aristotle's Physics 5 to 8, London: Duckworth 1993/4;
D. Furley, Philoponus, Corollaries on Place and Void, London:
Duckworth, 1991. |
| 529 |
On the Eternity of the World against Proclus (De
aeternitate mundi contra Proclum), ed. H. Rabe, Leipzig:
B.G. Teubner, 1899; repr. Hildesheim: Olms, 1984. (A detailed
criticism of Proclus' eighteen arguments in favour of the
eternity of the world.) |
| c.530-34 |
On the Eternity of the World against Aristotle (De
aeternitate mundi contra Aristotelem), not extant; fragments
reconstr. and trans. C. Wildberg, Philoponus, Against Aristotle
on the Eternity of the World, London: Duckworth, 1987. (A
refutation of Aristotle's doctrines of the fifth element and the
eternity of motion and time, consisting of at least eight books.) |
| c.530-35 |
Commentary on Aristotle's ‘Meteorology’,
ed. M. Hayduck, CAG XIV 1, Berlin: Reimer, 1901. |
| c.530-35 |
On the Contingency of the World (De contingentia
mundi), not extant; Arabic summary of the treatise
trans. S. Pines, ‘An Arabic summary of a lost work of John
Philoponus’, Israel Oriental Studies 2 (1972): 320-52;
similar excerpts in Simplicius, see D. Furley, C. Wildberg,
Philoponus, Corollaries on Place and Void with Simplicius,
Against Philoponus on the Eternity of the World, London:
Duckworth, 1991, pp. 95-141. |
| c.520-40 |
On the Use and Construction of the Astrolabe,
ed. H. Hase, Bonn: E. Weber, 1839 (or id. Rheinisches Museum
für Philologie 6 (1839): 127-71); repr. and trans. into
French A.P. Segonds, Jean Philopon, traité de
l'astrolabe, Paris: Librairie Alain Brieux, 1981;
trans. into English H.W. Green in R.T. Gunther, The Astrolabes of
the World, Vol. 1/2, Oxford, 1932, repr. London: Holland Press,
1976, pp. 61-81. (The oldest extant Greek treatise on the
astrolabe.) |
| c.530-40 |
Commentary on Nicomachus' Introduction to
Arithmetic, ed. R. Hoche, Part I/II Wesel: A. Bagel, 1864/65,
Part III Berlin: Calvary, 1867. |
| c.546-49 |
On the Creation of the World (De opificio
mundi), ed. W. Reichardt, Leipzig: Teubner, 1897. (A
theological-philosophical commentary on the Creation story in the book
of Genesis. The date of composition originally proposed by the editor
(546-49) appears to be more likely now than the frequently suggested
557-60.) |
| c.552 |
Arbiter (Diaitêtês), not extant in
Greek; Syriac text with Latin trans. A. Sanda, Opuscula
monophysitica Ioannis Philoponi, Beirut: Typographia Catholica
PP.Soc.Jesu., 1930; extracts trans. into German W. Böhm,
Johannes Philoponos, Grammatikos von Alexandrien,
München, Paderborn, Wien: Schöningh, 1967, pp.414-29. (A
philosophical justification of monophysitism.) |
| 567 |
On the Trinity (De trinitate), not extant;
Syriac fragments trans. into Latin A. Van Roey, ‘Les fragments
trithéites de Jean Philopon', Orientalia Lovaniensia
Periodica 11 (1980): 135-63. (The main source for a
reconstruction of Philoponus' trinitarian doctrine.) |
For a more comprehensive list of all extant and lost works of
Philoponus see Scholten 1996, pp. 429-35.
- Fladerer, L. (1999) Johannes Philoponos "De opificio
mundi". Spätantikes Sprachdenken und christliche
Exegese. Stuttgart, Leipzig: Teubner.
- Haas, F.A.J. de (1997) John Philoponus' New Definition of
Prime Matter: Aspects of its Background in Neoplatonism and the
Ancient Commentary Tradition. Leiden, New York: E.J. Brill.
- Hainthaler, T. (1990) "Johannes Philoponus, Philosoph und Theologe
in Alexandria". In Jesus der Christus im Glauben der Kirche,
Band 2/4: Die Kirche von Alexandrien mit Nubien und Äthiopien
nach 451, ed. A. Grillmeier, Freiburg, Basel, Wien: Herder,
pp. 109-49.
- Krafft, F. (1988) "Aristoteles aus christlicher Sicht. Umformungen
aristotelischer Bewegungslehren durch Johannes Philoponos". In
Zwischen Wahn, Glaube und Wissenschaft, ed. J.-F. Bergier,
Zurich: Verlag der Fachvereine an den Schweizerischen Hochschulen und
Techniken.
- Lee, T.-S. (1984) Die griechische Tradition der
aristotelischen Syllogistik in der Spätantike,
Göttingen: Vandenhoeck & Ruprecht.
- Sambursky, S. (1962) The Physical World of Late
Antiquity, London: Routledge and Kegan Paul, pp. 154-75.
- Scholten, C. (1996) Antike Naturphilosophie und christliche
Kosmologie in der Schrift "De opificio mundi" des Johannes
Philoponos. Berlin: De Gruyter.
- Sorabji, R.R.K. (1983) Time, Creation and the Continuum,
London: Duckworth, pp. 193-231.
- Sorabji, R.R.K. (ed.) (1987) Philoponus and the Rejection of
Aristotelian Science, London: Duckworth.
- Sorabji, R.R.K. (1988) Matter, Space, and Motion, London:
Duckworth, pp. 227-48.
- Verbeke, G. (1985) "Levels of Human Thinking in Philoponus". In
After Chalcedon: Studies in Theology and Church History,
ed. C. Laga, J.A. Munitz, L. van Rompay, Leuven: Peeters,
pp. 451-70.
- Verrycken, K. (1990) "The development of Philoponus' thought
and its chronology". In Aristotle Transformed,
ed. R.R.K. Sorabji, London: Duckworth, pp. 233-74.
- Wildberg, C. (1988) John Philoponus' Criticism of
Aristotle's Theory of Aether, Berlin: De Gruyter.
- Wildberg, C. (1999) "Impetus Theory and the Hermeneutics of
Science in Simplicius and Philoponus". Hyperboreus 5,
pp. 107-124.
- Wolff, M. (1971) Fallgesetz und Massebegriff. Zwei
wissenschaftshistorische Untersuchungen zum Ursprung der klassischen
Mechanik. Berlin: De Gruyter.
- Wolff, M. (1978) Geschichte der Impetustheorie. Untersuchungen
zum Ursprung der klassischen Mechanik. Frankfurt/M.:
Suhrkamp.
[Please contact the author with suggestions.]
Ammonius Hermeiou |
Aristotle |
Aristotle, commentators on |
Neoplatonism |
Simplicius
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