just in case the laws of
T are derivable from those
of T.| This is a file in the archives of the Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy. |
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reduce to a theory T? How is one to understand
the nature of this reduction relation? Interestingly, there are two
distinct, yet, related ways of understanding the reductive
relationship between T and
T. Thomas Nickles noted
this in a paper entitled "Two Concepts of Intertheoretic Reduction."
On the one hand, there is the "philosopher's" sense of reduction
on which the supplanted theory is said to reduce to the newer more
encompassing theory. On the other hand, the "physicist's" sense
of reduction puts things the other way. The newer, typically more
refined theory is said to reduce to the older typically less
encompassing theory in some sort of limit. These two senses of
reduction will be discussed in turn.
just in case the laws of
T are derivable from those
of T.Showing how these derivations are possible for "paradigm" examples of intertheoretic reduction turns out to be rather difficult.
Nagel distinguishes two types of reductions on the basis of whether
or not the vocabulary of the reduced theory is a subset of the
reducing theory. If it is---that is, if the reduced theory
T contains no descriptive
terms not contained in the reducing theory T, and the terms
of
T are understood to have
approximately the same meanings that they have in T, then
Nagel calls the reduction of
T by T
"homogeneous." In this case, while the reduction may very well be
enlightening in various respects, and is part of the "normal
development of a science," most people believe that there is nothing
terribly special or interesting from a philosophical point of view
going on here. (Nagel, 1961, p. 339.)
Lawrence Sklar (1967, p. 110--111) points out that, from a historical perspective, this attitude is somewhat naive. The number of actual cases in the history of science where a genuine homogeneous reduction takes place are few and far between. Nagel, himself, took as a paradigm example of homogeneous reduction, the reduction of the Galilean laws of falling bodies to Newtonian mechanics. But, as Sklar points out, what actually can be derived from the Newtonian theory are approximations to the laws of the reduced Galilean theory. The approximations, of course, are strictly speaking incompatible with the actual laws and so, despite the fact that no concepts appear in the Galilean theory that do not also appear in the Newtonian theory, there is no deductive derivation of the laws of the one from the laws of the other. Hence, strictly speaking, there is no reduction on the deductive Nagelian model.
One way out of this problem for the proponent of Nagel-type reductions is to make a distinction between explaining a theory (or explaining the laws of a given theory) and explaining it away. (Sklar, 1967, pp. 112--113) Thus, we may still speak of reduction if the derivation of the approximations to the reduced theory's laws serves to account for why the reduced theory works as well as it does in its (perhaps more limited) domain of applicability. This is consonant with more sophisticated versions of Nagel-type reductions in which part of the very process of reduction involves revisions to the reduced theory. This process arises as a natural consequence of trying to deal with what Nagel calls "heterogeneous" reductions.
The task of characterizing reduction is more involved when the reduction is heterogenous---that is, when the reduced theory contains terms or concepts that do not appear in the reducing theory. Nagel takes, as a paradigm example of heterogeneous reduction, the (apparent) reduction of thermodynamics, or at least some parts of thermodynamics, to statistical mechanics.[1] For instance, thermodynamics contains the concept of temperature (among others) that is lacking in the reducing theory of statistical mechanics.
Nagel notes that "if the laws of the secondary science [the reduced theory] contain terms that do not occur in the theoretical assumptions of the primary discipline [the reducing theory] ... , the logical derivation of the former from the latter is prima facie impossible." (Nagel, 1961, p. 352) As a consequence, Nagel introduces two "necessary formal conditions" required for the reduction to take place:
] and traits
represented by theoretical terms already present in the primary
[reducing] science."The connectability condition brings with it a number of interpretive problems. Exactly what is, or should be, the status of the "suitable relations," often called bridge "laws" or bridge hypotheses? Are they established by linguistic investigation alone? Are they factual discoveries? If the latter, what sort of necessity do they involve? Are they identity relations that are contingently necessary or will some sort of weaker relation, such as nomic coextensivity, suffice? Much of the philosophical literature on reduction addresses these questions about the status of the bridge laws.[2]
The consideration of certain examples lends plausibility to the idea, prevalent in the literature, that the bridge laws should be considered to express some kind of identity relation. For instance, Sklar notes that the reduction of the "theory" of physical optics to the theory of electromagnetic radiation proceeds by identifying one class of entities -- light waves -- with (part of) another class -- electromagnetic radiation. He says "... the place of correlatory laws [bridge laws] is taken by empirically established identifications of two classes of entities. Light waves are not correlated with electromagnetic waves, for they are electromagnetic waves." (Sklar, 1967, p. 120) In fact, if something like Nagelian reduction is going to work, it is generally accepted that the bridge laws should reflect the existence of some kind of synthetic identity.
Kenneth Schaffner calls the bridge laws "reduction functions." He too notes that they must be taken to reflect synthetic identities since, at least initially they require empirical support for their justification. "Genes were not discovered to be DNA via the analysis of meaning; important and difficult empirical research was required to make such an identification." (Schaffner, 1976. pp. 614--615)
Now one problem facing this sort of account was forcefully presented by Feyerabend in "Explanation, Reduction, and Empiricism." (Feyerabend, 1962) Consider the term "temperature" as it functions in classical thermodynamics. This term is defined in terms of Carnot cycles and is related to the strict, nonstatistical second law as it appears in that theory. The so-called reduction of classical thermodynamics to statistical mechanics, however, fails to identify or associate nonstatistical features in the reducing theory, statistical mechanics, with the nonstatistical concept of temperature as it appears in the reduced theory. How can one have a genuine reduction, if terms with their meanings fixed by the role they play in the reduced theory get identified with terms having entirely different meanings? Classical thermodynamics is not a statistical theory. The very possibility of finding a reduction function or bridge law that captures the concept of temperature and the strict, nonstatistical, role it plays in the thermodynamics seems impossible.
The plausibility of this argument, of course, depends on certain views about how meaning accrues to theoretical terms in a theory. However, just by looking at the historical development of thermodynamics one thing seems fairly clear. Most physicists, now, would accept the idea that our concept of temperature and our conception of other "exact" terms that appear in classical thermodynamics such as "entropy," need to be modified in light of the alleged reduction to statistical mechanics. Textbooks, in fact, typically speak of the theory of "statistical thermodynamics." The very process of "reduction" often leads to a corrected version of the reduced theory.
In fact, Schaffner and others have developed sophisticated Nagelian
type schemas for reduction that explicitly try to capture these
features of actual theory change. The idea is explicitly to include
in the model, the "corrected reduced theory" such as statistical
thermodynamics. Thus, Schaffner (1976, p. 618) holds that T
reduces
T if and only if
there is a corrected version of
T, call it
T* such that
* are associated via
reduction functions (or bridge laws) with various terms of
T.* is derivable from
T when it is supplemented with the reduction functions
specified in 1.* corrects
T in that it makes more
accurate predictions than does
T. is explained by T
in that
T and
T* are strongly
analogous to one another, and T indicates why
T works as well as it does
in its domain of validity.
Much work clearly is being done here by the intuitive conception of
"strong analogy" between the reduced theory
T and the corrected
reduced theory
T*. In some cases, as
suggested by Nickles and Wimsatt, the conception of strong analogy
may find further refinement by appeal to what was referred to as the
"physicists" sense of reduction.
Philosphical theories of reduction would have it that, say, quantum
mechanics reduces classical mechanics through the derivation of the
laws of classical physics from those of quantum physics. Most
physicists would, on the other hand, speak of quantum mechanics
reducing to classical mechanics in some kind of correspondence limit
(e.g., the limit as Planck's constant
(h/2
) goes to zero). Thus, the
second type of intertheoretic reduction noted by Nickles fits the
following schema:
Schema R: limHere Tf is the typically newer, more fine theory, Tc is the typically older, coarser theory, and0 Tf = Tc
is a fundamental parameter
appearing in Tf .
One must take the equality here with a small grain of salt. In those situations where Schema R can be said to hold, it is likely not the case that every equation or formula from Tf will yield a corresponding equation of Tc .
Even given this caveat, the equality in Schema R can hold only if the limit is "regular." In such circumstances, it can be argued that it is appropriate to call the limiting relation a "reduction." If the limit in Schema R is singular, however, the schema fails and it is best to talk simply about intertheoretic relations.
One should understand the difference between regular and singular
limiting relations as follows. If the solutions of the relevant
formulae or equations of the theory Tf
are such that for small values of they smoothly approach the solutions of the
corresponding formulas in Tc, then
Schema R will hold. For these cases we can say that
the "limiting behavior" as
0
equals the "behavior in the limit" where
= 0.
On the other hand, if the behavior in the limit is of a
fundamentally different character than the nearby solutions
one obtains as
0,
then the schema will fail.
A nice example illustrating this distinction is the following:
Consider the quadratic equation x2 +
x 
9 = 0.
Think of as a
small expansion or perturbation parameter. The equation has two roots
for any value of
as
0.
In a well-defined sense, the solutions to this
quadratic equation as
0
smoothly approach solutions to
the "unperturbed" ( = 0) equation
x2 + x = 0; namely, x = 0,
1.
On the other hand, the equation
x2 +
x 9 = 0
has two roots for any value of
> 0
but has for the its "unperturbed" solution only one root; namely,
x = 9. The equation suffers a reduction in order when
= 0.
Thus, the character of the behavior in the limit
= 0 differs fundamentally from
the character of its limiting behavior. Not all singular limits
result from reductions in order of the equations. Nevertheless, these
latter singular cases are much more prevalent than the former.
A paradigm case where a limiting reduction of the form R
rather straightforwardly holds is that of classical Newtonian
particle mechanics (NM) and the special theory of relativity (SR). In
the limit where
(v/c)20,
SR reduces to
NM. Nickles says "epitomizing [the intertheoretic reduction of SR to
NM] is the reduction of the Einsteinian formula for momentum,
p = m0v /where m0 is the rest mass, to the classical formula p = m0v in the limit as v(1
0."[3]
(Nickles, 1973, p. 182)
This is a regular limit---there are no singularities or "blowups" as
the asymptotic limit is approached. As noted one way of thinking
about this is that the exact solutions for small but nonzero values
of || "smoothly [approach] the
unperturbed or zeroth-order solution
[
set identically equal to zero] as
0."
In the case where the limit is singular "the exact solution for
= 0 is fundamentally different in
character from the ‘neighboring’ solutions obtained in
the limit
0."
(Bender and Orszag, 1978, p. 324)
In the current context, one can express the regular nature of the limiting relation in the following way. The fundamental expression appearing in the Lorentz transformations of SR , can be expanded in a Taylor series as
1/and so the limit is analytic. This means that (at least some) quantities or expressions of SR can be written as Newtonian or classical quantities plus an expansion of corrections in powers of (v/c)2. So one may think of this relationship between SR and NM as a regular perturbation problem.
Examples like this have led some investigators to think of limiting
relations as forming a kind of new rule of inference which would allow
one to more closely connect the physicists' sense of reduction with
that of the philosophers'. Fritz Rohrlich, for example, has argued that
NM reduces (in the philosophers' sense) to SR because the
mathematical framework of SR reduces (in the physicists'
sense) to the mathematical framework of NM. The idea is that
the mathematical framework of NM is "rigorously derived" from that of
SR in a "derivation which involves limiting procedures." (Rohrlich,
1988, p. 303) Roughly speaking, for Rohrlich a "coarser" theory is
reducible to a "finer" theory in the philosophers' sense of being
rigorously deduced from the latter just in case the mathematical
framework of the finer theory reduces in the physicists' sense to the
mathematical framework of the coarser theory. In such cases, we will
have a systematic explication of the idea of "strong analogy" to which
Schaffner appeals in his model of philosophical reduction. The
corrected theory
T* in this context is the
perturbed Newtonian theory as expressed in the Taylor expansion given
above. The "strong analogy" between Newtonian theory
T and the corrected
T* is expressed by the
existence of the regular Taylor series expansion.
As noted the trouble with maintaining that this relationship between the philosophical and "physical" models of reduction holds generally is that far more often than not the limiting relations between the theories are singular and not regular. In such situations, Schema R fails to hold. Paradigm cases here include the relationships between classical mechanics and quantum mechanics, the ray theory of light and the wave theory, and thermodynamics and statistical mechanics of systems in critical states.
It seems reasonable to expect something like philosophical reductions to be possible in those situations where Schema R holds. On the other hand, neither philosophical nor "physical" reduction seems possible when the limiting correspondence relation between the theories is singular. Perhaps in such cases it is best to speak simply of intertheoretic relations rather than reductions. It is here that much of philosophical and physical interest is to be found. This claim and the following discussion should not be taken to be anything like the received view among philosophers of science. Instead, it reflects the views of the author.
Nevertheless, here is a passage from a recent paper by Michael Berry which expresses a similar point of view.
Even within physical science, reduction between different levels of explanation is problematic--indeed, it is almost always so. Chemistry is supposed to have been reduced to quantum mechanics, yet people still argue over the basic question of how quantum mechanics can describe the shape of a molecule. The statistical mechanics of a fluid reduces to its thermodynamics in the limit of infinitely many particles, yet that limit breaks down near the critical point, where liquid and vapour merge, and where we never see a continuum no matter how distantly we observe the particles . . . . The geometrical (newtonian) optics of rays should be the limit of wave optics as the wavelength becomes negligibly small, yet . . . the reduction (mathematically similar to that of classical to quantum mechanics) is obstructed by singularities ... .
My contention ... will be that many difficulties associated with reduction arise because they involve singular limits. These singularities have both negative and positive aspects: they obstruct the smooth reduction of more general theories to less general ones, but they also point to a great richness of borderland physics between theories. (Berry, forthcoming, p. 3)
When Schema R fails this is because the mathematics of the
particular limit
(0) is singular. One can ask what, physically, is
responsible for this mathematical singularity. In investigating the
answer to this question one will often find that the mathematical
blow-up reflects a physical impossibility. For instance, if
Schema R held when Tf
is the wave theory of light and Tc is
the ray theory (geometrical optics), then one would expect to recover
rays in the shortwave limit
0
of the wave theory. On the ray theory, rays are the carriers of
energy. But in certain situations families of rays can focus on
surfaces or lines called "caustics." These are not strange estoteric
situations. In fact, rainbows are, to a first approximation,
described by the focusing of sunlight on these surfaces following its
refraction and reflection through raindrops. However, according to
the ray theory, the intensity of the light on these focusing surfaces
would be infinite. This is part of the physical reason for
the mathematical singularities.
One is led to study the asymptotic domain in which the parameter
in Schema R
approaches 0. In the example above, this is the short wavelength
limit. Michael Berry (1980,1990, 1994a, 1994b) has done much research
on this and other asymptotic domains. He has found that in the
asymptotic borderlands between such theories there emerge phenomena
whose explanation requires in some sense appeal to a third
intermediate theory. The emergent structures (the rainbow itself is
one of them) are not fully explainable either in terms of the finer
wave theory or in terms of the ray theory alone. Instead, aspects of
both theories are required for a full understanding of these emergent
phenomena.
This fact calls into question certain received views about the nature of intertheoretic relations. The wave theory, for example, is surely the fundamental theory. Nevertheless, these considerations seem to show that that theory is itself explanatorily deficient. There are phenomena within its scope whose explanations require reference to structures that exist only in the superseded, false, ray theory. A similar situation arises in the asymptotic domain between quantum mechanics and classical mechanics where Planck's constant can be considered asymptotically small.
There is much here worthy of further philosophical study. See (Batterman 1993, 1995, and forthcoming) for the beginnings of some work in this direction.| Robert Batterman batterman.1@osu.edu |