In Physics iv.1-5 Aristotle distinguishes four notions as candidates
for place. Each is understood in terms of a contained or containing
body and in terms of either the limit (shape or form) of a magnitude or
the extension within the limit of the magnitude:
- the extension of the magnitude of the contained body (this is the
matter of the magnitude);
- the extension between the inner limit of the containing body
(Aristotle argues that this is a fiction);
- the limit of the contained body (this is the form, i.e., shape, of
the contained body);
- the inner limit of the containing body (Aristotle argues that this
is place).
Since Aristotle only is thinking here of the place of a body, he needs
to expand the notion or at least to treat it more cavalierly than he
does in this discussion. In fact, any magnitude will have place when he
turns to the discussion of continuity.
From Physics v.3 (a discussion of perceptible quantities),
cf. also Categories 6, we have the following central
notions:
- Together or in contact (hama) and Apart
(khôris)
- Two magnitudes are together if they occupy the same place.
- Two magnitudes are apart or separate if they occupy two distinct
places.
- Touching (haptesthai) and Between (metaxu): Two
magnitudes touch (are in contact) if their limits (akra) are
together.
- Between (metaxu) pertains to continuous change: what is
between is that which a continuous changer arrives at before it arrives
at the end of the change.
- Succession (ephexês): X is in succession to
Y with regard to position or something else, if there is
nothing of the same kind between X and Y, and
X comes after Y. A pair comes after a unit.
- Contiguous or held (ekhomenon): X is connected to
Y if X is in succession to Y and X
is in contact with Y.
- Continuous or held together (synekhes): X is
continuous with Y if X is contiguous with Y
and their limits at which they are in contact are one and ‘held
together’.