| a(n) | = | { |
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| This is a file in the archives of the Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy. |
Consider a still open problem in mathematics, such as Goldbach's conjecture (the conjecture that every even number equal to or greater than 4 is the sum of two prime numbers).
Being a still open problem, Goldbach's conjecture is by itself a weak counterexample to PEM: we have at present experienced neither its truth nor its falsity, so intuitionistically speaking, it is at present neither true nor false, and hence we cannot assert ‘Goldbach's conjecture is true, or it is false’.
As an illustration of the technique that Brouwer used to generate weak counterexamples to other classically valid statements, we show three more weak counterexamples, adapted from the first Vienna lecture (Brouwer, 1929). They are based on a sequence of rational numbers a(n), defined in terms of Goldbach's conjecture, as follows:
a(n) = {
-(½)n if for all j n, 2j+4 is the sum of two primes
-(½)k if for some k
The sequence of the a(n) satisfies the Cauchy condition
(the condition that for every rational number
> 0 there is a
natural number N such that |a(j)-a(k)| <
for all
j,k>N), as for every n, any two members
of the sequence after a(n) lie within
(½)n of each other. Therefore the sequence
converges and determines a real number
.
From the way
is
constructed, it is clear that we can assert that
=0
only when we know that
always the first clause of the definition of a(n) applies, in
other words, only when we have proved Goldbach's conjecture; and we can
assert that
0 only when
we know that for some n the second clause applies, in other
words, when we have found a counterexample to the conjecture. So far, we
have neither. This leads to the following three weak
counterexamples:
x
(x = 0
x
0),
because we cannot, intuitionistically, assert
= 0
0 until we have a
proof of one of the disjuncts.x (x < 0
x = 0
x > 0).x
(x
Q
x
Q), for to assert that
Q we
have to know m,nZ
such that
=
m/n, but we can't as long as we do not know the value
of
. (By construction, cannot
be irrational.)
Should Goldbach's conjecture one day be proved or disproved, the
definition of
can
easily be modified by appealing to a remaining open problem; Brouwer's
first Vienna lecture shows a general way to do
this.
| Mark van Atten Mark.vanAtten@univ-paris1.fr |