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Hans-Georg Gadamer
Hans-Georg Gadamer is the decisive figure in the development of
twentieth century hermeneutics. Trained in neo-Kantian scholarship, as
well as in classical philology, and profoundly affected by the
philosophy of Martin Heidegger, Gadamer developed a distinctive and
thoroughly dialogical approach, grounded in Platonic-Aristotelian as
well as Heideggerian thinking, that rejects subjectivism and
relativism, abjures any simple notion of interpretive method, and
grounds understanding in the linguistically mediated happening of
tradition. Employing a more orthodox and modest, but also more
accessible style than Heidegger himself, Gadamer's work can be seen as
concentrated in four main areas: the first, and clearly the most
influential, is the development and elaboration of a philosophical
hermeneutics; the second is the dialogue within philosophy, and within
the history of philosophy, with respect to Plato and Aristotle in
particular, but also with Hegel and Heidegger; the third is the
engagement with literature, particularly poetry, and with art; and the
fourth is what Gadamer himself terms ‘practical philosophy’ (see
Gadamer, 2001, 78-85) encompassing contemporary political and ethical
issues. The ‘dialogical’ character of Gadamer's approach is evident,
not merely in the central theoretical role he gives to the concept of
dialogue in his thinking, but also in the discursive and dialogic, even
‘conversational’, character of his writing, as well as in his own
personal commitment to intellectual engagement and exchange. Indeed, he
is one of the few philosophers for whom the ‘interview’ has become a
significant category of philosophical output (see Hahn, 1997, 588-599).
Although he identified connections between his own work and
English-speaking ‘analytic’ thought (mainly via the later Wittgenstein,
but also Donald Davidson), and has sometimes seen his ideas taken up by
thinkers such as Richard Rorty and John McDowell, Gadamer is perhaps
less well known, and certainly less well-appreciated, in philosophical
circles outside Europe than are some of his near-contemporaries. He is
undoubtedly, however, one of the most important thinkers of the
twentieth century, having had an enormous impact on a range of areas
from aesthetics to theology, and having acquired a respect and
reputation in Germany, and elsewhere in Europe, that went far beyond
the usual confines of academia.
Born on February 11, 1900, in Marburg, in Southern Germany, Hans-Georg
Gadamer grew up in Breslau (now Wroclaw in Poland), where his father
was Professor of Pharmacy. Showing an early interest in humanistic
studies, he attended the University of Breslau in 1918, returning to
Marburg with his family in 1919, and completing his doctoral studies
(in his own words ‘too young’ -- see Gadamer, 1997b, 7) in 1922.
Gadamer's early teachers were Paul Natorp and Nicolai Hartmann, while
Paul Friedlander introduced him to philological study (Gadamer passed
the State Examination in Classical Philology in 1927). It was, however,
Martin Heidegger (at Marburg from 1923-1928) who exerted the most
important and enduring effect on Gadamer's philosophical development.
Gadamer worked as Heidegger's assistant for a time, and although
Gadamer took Heidegger to be disappointed with his early habilitation
research, Gadamer finally submitted his habilitation dissertation
('Plato's Dialectical Ethics', [1991]), in 1928, under the guidance of
Friedlander and Heidegger. During the 1930s and 1940s, Gadamer was able
to accommodate himself, albeit reluctantly, first to National Socialism
and then briefly, to Communism. While Gadamer was not an active
supporter of either regime (he was never a member of the NSDAP),
neither did he draw attention to himself by outright opposition, and
some have seen his stance as too acquiescent (see Gadamer, 2001, for
his own comments on this period). In 1953, together with Helmut Kuhn,
Gadamer founded the highly influential Philosophische
Rundschau, but his main philosophical impact was not felt until
the publication of Truth and Method in 1960 (1989b). He
engaged in a number of important public debates in the following
decades, most notably with Emilio Betti, Jürgen Habermas and
Jacques Derrida. Gadamer was twice married: in 1923, to Frida Kratz
(later divorced), and, in 1950, to Käte Lekebusch. Gadamer
received numerous awards and prizes including, in 1971, Knight of the
‘Order of Merit’ -- the highest academic honor awarded in Germany.
Gadamer died in Heidelberg on March 13, 2002, at the age of 102.
Gadamer's first academic appointment was to a junior position in
Marburg in 1928, finally achieving a lower-level professorship there in
1937. In the meantime, from 1934-35, Gadamer held a temporary
professorship at Kiel, and then, in 1939, took up the Directorship of
the Philosophical Institute at the University of Leipzig, becoming Dean
of the Faculty in 1945, and Rector in 1946, before returning to
teaching and research at Frankfurt-am-Main in 1947. In 1949, he
succeeded Karl Jaspers at Heidelberg, officially retiring (becoming
Professor Emeritus) in 1968. Following his retirement, he traveled
extensively, spending considerable time in North America, where he was
a visitor at a number of institutions and developed an especially close
and regular association with Boston College in Massachusetts.
Gadamer's thinking began and always remained connected with Greek
thought, especially that of Plato and Aristotle. In this respect,
Gadamer's early engagement with Plato, which lay at the core of both
his doctoral and habilitation dissertations, was determinative of much
of the character and philosophical direction of his thinking. Under the
influence of his early teachers such as Hartmann, as well as
Friedlander, Gadamer developed an approach to Plato that rejected the
idea of any ‘hidden’ doctrine in Plato's thought, looking instead to
the structure of the Platonic dialogues themselves as the key to
understanding Plato's philosophy. The only way to understand Plato, as
Gadamer saw it, was thus by working through the Platonic texts in a way
that not only enters into the dialogue and dialectic set out in those
texts, but also repeats that dialogic movement in the attempt at
understanding as such. Moreover, the dialectical structure of Platonic
questioning also provides the model for a way of understanding that is
open to the matter at issue through bringing oneself into question
along with the matter itself. Under the influence of Heidegger, Gadamer
also took up, as a central element in his thinking, the idea of
phronesis ('practical wisdom’) that appears in Book IV of
Aristotle's Nichomachean Ethics. For Heidegger the concept of
phronesis is important, not only as a means of giving emphasis
to our practical ‘being-in-the world’ over and against theoretical
apprehension, but it can additionally be seen as constituting a mode of
insight into our own concrete situation (both our practical situation
and, more fundamentally, our existential situation, hence
phronesis constitutes a mode of self-knowledge). The way in
which Gadamer conceives of understanding, and interpretation, is as
just such a practically oriented mode of insight -- a mode of insight
that has its own rationality irreducible to any simple rule or set of
rules, that cannot be directly taught, and that is always oriented to
the particular case at hand. The concept of phronesis can
itself be seen as providing a certain elaboration of the dialogic
conception of understanding Gadamer had already found in Plato, and,
taken together, these two concepts can se seen as providing the
essential starting point for the development of Gadamer's philosophical
hermeneutics.
Traditionally, hermeneutics is taken to have its origins in problems of
biblical exegesis and in the development of a theoretical framework to
govern and direct such exegetical practice. In the hands of eighteenth
and early nineteenth century theorists, writers such as Chladenius and
Meier, Ast and Schleiermacher, hermeneutics was developed into a more
encompassing theory of textual interpretation in general -- a set of
rules that provide the basis for good interpretive practice no matter
what the subject matter. Inasmuch as hermeneutics is the method proper
to the recovery of meaning, so Wilhelm Dilthey broadened hermeneutics
still further, taking it as the methodology for the recovery of meaning
that is essential to understanding within the ‘human’ or ‘historical’
sciences (the Geisteswissenschaften). For these writers, as
for many others, the basic problem of hermeneutics was methodological:
how to found the human sciences, and so how to found the science of
interpretation, in a way that would make them properly ‘scientific’.
Moreover, if the mathematical models and procedures that appeared to be
the hallmark of the sciences of nature could not be duplicated in the
human sciences, then the task at issue must involve finding an
alternative methodology proper to the human sciences as such -- hence
Schleiermacher's ambition to develop a formal methodology that would
codify interpretive practice, while Dilthey aimed at the elaboration of
a ‘psychology’ that would elucidate and guide interpretive
understanding.
Already familiar with earlier hermeneutic thinking, Heidegger
redeployed hermeneutics to a very different purpose and within a very
different frame. In Heidegger's early thinking, particularly the
lectures from the early 1920s ('The Hermeneutics of Facticity’),
hermeneutics is presented as that by means of which the investigation
of the basic structures of factical existence is to be pursued -- not
as that which constitutes a ‘theory’ of textual interpretation nor a
method of ‘scientific’ understanding, but rather as that which allows
the self-disclosure of the structure of understanding as such. The
‘hermeneutic circle’ that had been a central idea in previous
hermeneutic thinking, and that had been viewed in terms of the
interpretative interdependence, within any meaningful structure,
between the parts of that structure and the whole, was transformed by
Heidegger, so that it was now seen as expressing the way in which all
understanding was ‘always already’ given over to that which is to be
understood (to ‘the things themselves' -- 'die Sachen
selbst’). Thus, to take a simple example, if we wish to understand
some particular artwork, we already need to have some prior
understanding of that work (even if only as a set of paintmarks on
canvas), otherwise it cannot even be seen as something to be
understood. To put the point more generally, and in more basic
ontological terms, if we are to understand anything at all, we must
already find ourselves ‘in’ the world ‘along with’ that which is to be
understood. All understanding that is directed at the grasp of some
particular subject matter is thus based in a prior ‘ontological’
understanding -- a prior hermeneutical situatedness. On this basis,
hermeneutics can be understood as the attempt to ‘make explicit’ the
structure of such situatedness. Yet since that situatedness is indeed
prior to any specific event of understanding, so it must always be
presupposed even in the attempt at its own explication. Consequently,
the explication of this situatedness -- of this basic ontological mode
of understanding -- is essentially a matter of exhibiting or
‘laying-bare’ a structure with which we are already familiar (the
structure that is present in every event of understanding), and, in
this respect, hermeneutics becomes one with phenomenology, itself
understood, in Heidegger's thinking, as just such a ‘laying bare’.
It is hermeneutics, in this Heideggerian and phenomenological sense,
that is taken up in Gadamer's work, and that leads him, in conjunction
with certain other insights from Heidegger's later thinking, as well as
the ideas of dialogue and practical wisdom, to elaborate a
philosophical hermeneutics that provides an account of the nature of
understanding in its universality (where this refers both to the
ontologically fundamental character of the hermeneutical situation and
the all-encompassing nature of hermeneutic practice) and, in the
process, to develop a response to the earlier hermeneutic tradition's
preoccupation with the problem of interpretive method. In these
respects, Gadamer's work, in conjunction with that of Heidegger,
represents a radical reworking of the idea of hermeneutics that
constitutes a break with the preceding hermeneutical tradition, and yet
also reflects back on that tradition. Gadamer thus develops a
philosophical hermeneutics that provides an account of the proper
ground for understanding, while nevertheless rejecting the attempt,
whether in relation to the Geisteswissenschaften or elsewhere,
to found understanding on any method or set of rules. This is not a
rejection of the importance of methodological concerns, but rather an
insistence on the limited role of method and the priority of
understanding as a dialogic, practical, situated activity.
1n 1936 Heidegger gave three lectures on ‘The Origin of the Work of
Art.’ In these lectures, not published until 1950, Heidegger connects
art with truth, arguing that the essence of the artwork is not its
‘representational’ character, but rather its capacity to allow the
disclosure of a world. Thus the Greek temple establishes the ‘Greek’
world and in so doing allows things to take on a particular appearance
within that world. Heidegger refers to this event of disclosure as the
event of ‘truth’. The sense of truth at issue here is one that
Heidegger presents in explicit contrast to what he views as the
traditional concept of truth as ‘correctness'. Such correctness is
usually taken to consist in some form of correspondence between
individual statements and the world, but so-called ‘coherence’ accounts
of truth, according to which truth is a matter of the consistency of a
statement with a larger body of statements, can also be viewed as based
upon the same underlying notion of truth as ‘correctness'. While
Heidegger does not abandon the notion of truth as ‘correctness', he
argues that it is derivative of a more basic sense of truth as what he
terms ‘unconcealment’. Understood in this latter sense, truth is not a
property of statements as they stand in relation to the world, but
rather an event or process in and through which both the things of the
world and what is said about them come to be revealed at one and the
same time -- the possibility of ‘correctness' arises on the basis of
just such ‘unconcealment’.
It is important to recognize, however, that the unconcealment at
issue is not a matter of the bringing about of some form of complete
and absolute transparency. The revealing of things is, in fact, always
dependent upon other things being simulataneously concealed (in much
the same way as seeing something in one way depends on not seeing it in
another). Truth is thus understood as the unconcealment that allows
things to appear, and that also makes possible the truth and falsity of
individual statements, and yet which arises on the basis of the ongoing
play between unconcealment and concealment -- a play that, for
the most part, remains itself hidden and is never capable of complete
elucidation. In the language Heidegger employs in ‘The Origin of the
Work of Art’, the unconcealment of ‘world’ is thereby grounded in the
concealment of ‘earth’. It is this sense of truth as the emergence of
things into unconcealment that occurs on the basis of the play between
concealing and unconcealing that is taken by Heidegger as the essence
(or ‘origin’) of the work of art. This idea of truth, as well as the
poetic language Heidegger employed in his exposition, had a decisive
effect of Gadamer's own thinking. Indeed, Gadamer described his
philosophical hermeneutics as precisely an attempt to take up and
elaborate this line of thinking from the later Heidegger (Gadamer,
1997b, 47)
There are two crucial elements to Gadamer's appropriation of
Heidegger here: first, the focus on art, and the connection of art with
truth; second, the focus on truth itself as the event of prior and
partial disclosure (or more properly, of concealment/unconcealment) in
which we are already involved and that can never be made completely
transparent. Both of these elements are connected with Gadamer's
response to the subjectivist and idealist elements in German thought
that were present in the neo-kantian tradition, and, more specifically,
in romantic hermeneutics and aesthetic theory. As Gadamer saw it,
aesthetic theory had, largely under the influence of Kant, become
alienated from the actual experience of art -- the response to art had
become abstracted and ‘aestheticised’ -- and, at the same time,
aesthetic judgment had become purely a matter of taste and so of
subjective response. Similarly, under the influence of the ‘scientific’
historiography of such as Ranke, and the romantic hermeneutics
associated with Schleiermacher and others, the desire for objectivity
had led to the understanding of a text becoming alienated from the
contemporary situation that made that text relevant and significant,
while, at the same time, such understanding had come to be seen as a
matter of somehow reconstructing the subjective experiences of the
author, and yet such reconstruction, as Hegel made clear, was surely
impossible (see Gadamer, 1989b, 164-9).
By turning back to the direct experience of art, and to the concept
of truth as prior and partial disclosure, Gadamer was able to develop
an alternative to subjectivism that also connected with the ideas of
dialogue and practical wisdom taken from Plato and Aristotle, and of
hermeneutical situatedness taken from the early Heidegger. Just as the
artwork is taken as central and determining in the experience of art,
so is understanding similarly determined by the matter to be
understood; as the experience of art reveals, not in spite of, but
precisely because of the way it also conceals, so understanding is
possible, not in spite of, but precisely because of its prior
involvement. In Gadamer's developed work, the concept of ‘play’
(’Spiel’) has an important role here. Gadamer takes play as
the basic clue to the ontological structure of art, emphasizing the way
in which play is not a form of disengaged, disinterested exercise of
subjectivity, but is rather something that has its own order and
structure to which one is given over. The structure of play has obvious
affinities with all of the other concepts at issue here -- of dialogue,
phronesis, the hermeneutical situation, the truth of art.
Indeed, one can take all of these ideas as providing slightly different
elaborations of what is essentially the same basic conception of
understanding -- one that takes our finitude, that is, our prior
involvement and partiality, not as a barrier to understanding, but
rather as its enabling condition. It is this conception that is worked
out in detail in Truth and Method.
One might react to Gadamer's emphasis on our prior hermeneutic
involvement, whether in the experience of art or elsewhere, that such
involvement cannot but remain subjective simply on the grounds that it
is always determined by particular dispositions, on our part, to
experience things in certain ways rather than others -- our
involvement, one might say, is thus always based on subjective
‘prejudice’. Such an objection can be seen as a simple reiteration of
the basic tendency towards subjectivism that Gadamer rejects, but
Gadamer also takes issue directly with this view of prejudice, and the
negative connotations often associated with the notion, arguing that,
rather than closing us off, our prejudices (or ‘pre-judgments') are
themselves what open us up to what is to be understood. In Truth
and Method, Gadamer redeploys the notion of our prior
hermeneutical situatedness as it is worked out in more particular
fashion in Heidegger's Being and Time (first published in
1927) in terms of the ‘fore-structures' of understanding, that is, in
terms of the anticipatory structures that allow what is to be
interpreted or understood to be grasped in a preliminary fashion. The
fact that understanding operates by means of such anticipatory
structures means that understanding always involves what Gadamer terms
the ‘anticipation of completeness' -- it always involves the revisable
presupposition that what is to be understood constitutes something that
is understandable, that is, something that is constituted as a
coherent, and therefore meaningful, whole.
Gadamer's positive conception of prejudice can be seen as connected
with a number of different ideas in his hermeneutics. The way in which
our prejudices open us up to matter at issue in such a way that those
prejudices are themselves capable of being revised exhibits the
character of the Gadamerian conception of prejudice, and its role in
understanding, as itself constituting a version of the hermeneutic
circle. The hermeneutical priority Gadamer assigns to prejudice is also
tied to Gadamer's emphasis on the priority of the question in the
structure of understanding -- the latter emphasis being something
Gadamer takes both from Platonic dialectic and also, in Truth and
Method, from the work of R. G. Collingwood. Moreover, the
indispensable role of prejudice in understanding connects directly with
Gadamer's rethinking of the traditional concept of hermeneutics as
necessarily involving, not merely explication, but also
application. In this respect, all interpretation, even of the
past, is necessarily ‘prejudiced’ in the sense that it is always
oriented to present concerns and interests, and it is those present
concerns and interests that allow us to enter into the dialogue with
the matter at issue. Here, of course, there is a further connection
with the Aristotelian emphasis on the practical -- not only is
understanding a matter of the application of something like ‘practical
wisdom’, but it is also always determined by the practical context out
of which it arises.
The prejudicial character of understanding means that, whenever we
understand, we are involved in a dialogue that encompasses both our own
self-understanding and our understanding of the matter at issue. In the
dialogue of understanding our prejudices come to the fore, both
inasmuch as they play a crucial role in opening up what is to be
understood, and inasmuch as they themselves become evident in that
process. As our prejudices thereby become apparent to us, so they can
also become the focus of questioning in their own turn. While Gadamer
has claimed that ‘temporal distance’ can play a useful role in enabling
us better to identify those prejudices that exercise a problematic
influence on understanding (Gadamer acknowledges that prejudices can
sometimes distort -- the point is that they do not always do so), it
seems better to see the dialogical interplay that occurs in the process
of understanding itself as the means by which such problematic elements
are identified and worked through. One consequence of Gadamer's
rehabilitation of prejudice is a positive evaluation of the role of
authority and tradition as legitimate sources of knowledge, and this
has often been seen, most famously by Jürgen Habermas, as
indicative of Gadamer's ideological conservatism -- Gadamer himself
viewed it as merely providing a proper corrective to the over-reaction
against these ideas that occurred with the Enlightenment.
Inasmuch as understanding always occurs against the background of our
prior involvement, so it always occurs on the basis of our
history. Understanding, for Gadamer, is thus always an
‘effect’ of history, while hermeneutical ‘consciousness' is itself that
mode of being that is conscious of its own historical ‘being effected’
-- it is ‘historically-effected consciousness'
(wirkungsgeschictliches Bewußtsein). Awareness of the
historically effected character of understanding is, according to
Gadamer, identical with an awareness of the hermeneutical situation and
he also refers to that situation by means of the phenomenological
concept of ‘horizon’ (’Horizont’) -- understanding and
interpretation thus always occurs from within a particular ‘horizon’
that is determined by our historically-determined situatedness.
Understanding is not, however, imprisoned within the horizon of its
situation -- indeed, the horizon of understanding is neither static nor
unchanging (it is, after all, always subject to the effects of
history). Just as our prejudices are themselves brought into question
in the process of understanding, so, in the encounter with another, is
the horizon of our own understanding susceptible to change.
Gadamer views understanding as a matter of negotiation between
oneself and one's partner in the hermeneutical dialogue such that the
process of understanding can be seen as a matter of coming to an
‘agreement’ about the matter at issue. Coming to such an agreement
means establishing a common framework or ‘horizon’ and Gadamer thus
takes understanding to be a process of the ‘fusion of horizons'
(’Horizontverschmelzung’). The notion of ‘horizon’ employed
here derives from phenomenology according to which the ‘horizon’ is the
larger context of meaning in which any particular meaningful
presentation is situated. Inasmuch as understanding is taken to involve
a ‘fusion of horizons', then so it always involves the formation of a
new context of meaning that enables integration of what is otherwise
unfamiliar, strange or anaomalous. In this respect, all understanding
involves a process of mediation and dialogue between what is familiar
and what is alien in which neither remains unaffected. This process of
horizonal engagement is an ongoing one that never achieves any final
completion or complete elucidation -- moreover, inasmuch as our own
history and tradition is itself constitutive of our own hermeneutic
situation as well as being itself constantly taken up in the process of
understanding, so our historical and hermeneutic situation can never be
made completely transparent to us. As a consequence, Gadamer explicitly
takes issue with the Hegelian ‘philosophy of reflection’ that aims at
just such completion and transparency.
In contrast with the traditional hermeneutic account, Gadamer thus
advances a view of understanding that rejects the idea of understanding
as achieved through gaining access to some inner realm of subjective
meaning. Moreover, since understanding is an ongoing process, rather
than something that is ever completed, so he also rejects the idea that
there is any final determinacy to understanding. It is on this basis
that Gadamer argues against there being any method or technique for
achieving understanding or arriving at truth. The search for a
methodology for the Geisteswissenschaften that would place
them on a sound footing alongside the ‘sciences of nature’ (the
Naturwissenschaften)-- a search that had characterized much
previous hermeneutical inquiry -- is thus shown to be fundamentally
misguided. Not only is there no methodology that describes the means by
which to arrive at an understanding of the human or the historical, but
neither is there any such methodology that is adequate to the
understanding of the non-human or the natural. Gadamer's conception of
understanding as not reducible to method or technique, along with his
insistence of understanding as an ongoing process that has no final
completion, not only invites comparison with ideas to be found in the
work of the later Wittgenstein, but when applied to the philosophy of
science, can also be seen as paralleling the work of T. S. Kuhn and
others.
The basic model of understanding that Gadamer finally arrives at in
Truth and Method is that of conversation. A conversation
involves an exchange between conversational partners that seeks
agreement about some matter at issue; consequently, such an exchange is
never completely under the control of either conversational partner,
but is rather determined by the matter at issue. Conversation always
takes place in language and similarly Gadamer views understanding as
always linguistically mediated. Since both conversation and
understanding involve coming to an agreement, so Gadamer argues that
all understanding involves something like a common language, albeit a
common language that is itself formed in the process of understanding
itself. In this sense, all understanding is, according to Gadamer,
interpretative, and, insofar as all interpretation involves the
exchange between the familiar and the alien, so all interpretation is
also translative. Gadamer's commitment to the linguisticality of
understanding also commits him to a view of understanding as
essentially a matter of conceptual articulation. This does not rule out
the possibility of other modes of understanding, but it does give
primacy to language and conceptuality in hermeneutic experience.
Indeed, Gadamer takes language to be, not merely some instrument by
means of which we are able to engage with the world, but as instead the
very medium for such engagement. We are ‘in’ the world through being
‘in’ language. This emphasis on the linguisticality of understanding
does not, however, lead Gadamer into any form of linguistic relativism.
Just as we are not held inescapably captive within the circle of our
prejudices, or within the effects of our history, neither are we held
captive within language. Language is that within which anything that is
intelligible can be comprehended, it is also that within which we
encounter ourselves and others. In this respect, language is itself
understood as essentially dialogue or conversation. Like Wittgenstein,
as well as Davidson, Gadamer thus rejects the idea of such a thing as a
‘private language’ -- language always involves others, just as it
always involves the world.
Gadamer claims that language is the universal horizon of hermeneutic
experience; he also claims that the hermeneutic experience is itself
universal. This is not merely in the sense that the experience of
understanding is familiar or ubiquitous. The universality of
hermeneutics derives from the existential claim for hermeneutics that
Heidegger advanced in the 1920s and that Gadamer made into a central
idea in his own thinking. Hermeneutics concerns our fundamental mode of
being in the world and understanding is thus the basic phenomenon in
our existence. We cannot go back ‘behind’ understanding, since to do so
would be to suppose that there was a mode of intelligibility that was
prior to understanding. Hermeneutics thus turns out to be universal,
not merely in regard to knowledge, whether in the ‘human sciences' or
elsewhere, but to all understanding and, indeed, to philosophy itself.
Philosophy is, in its essence, hermeneutics. Gadamer's claim for the
universality of hermeneutics was one of the explicit points at issue in
the debate between Gadamer and Habermas (see Ormiston and Schrift
[eds.], 1990); it can also be seen as, in a certain sense, underlying
the engagement between Gadamer and Derrida (see Michelfelder and Palmer
[eds.], 1989), although in Derrida's case this consisted in a denial of
the primacy of understanding, and the possibility of agreement, on
which hermeneutics itself rests.
Gadamer's commitment to the historically conditioned character of
understanding, coupled with the hermeneutic imperative that we engage
with our historical situatedness, means that he takes philosophy to
itself stand in a critical relation to the history of philosophy.
Gadamer's own thought certainly reflects a hermeneutical commitment to
both philosophical dialogue and historical engagement. His public
debates with contemporary figures such as Habermas and Derrida,
although they have not always lived up to Gadamer's own ideals of
hermeneutic dialogue (at least not in respect of Derrida), have
provided clear evidence of Gadamer's own commitment to such engagement.
The dialogue with philosophy and its history also makes up a large part
of Gadamer's published work and, while that dialogue has encompassed a
range of thinkers, its primary focus has been on Plato, Aristotle,
Hegel and Heidegger.
In the case of Plato and Aristotle (see Gadamer 1980, 1986a, 1991),
Gadamer has argued for a particular way of reading both thinkers that
attends to the character of their texts, that takes those texts to
display a high degree of consistency, and that, particularly in the
later work, also views Plato and Aristotle as holding essentially
similar views. In The Beginning of Philosophy (1997a), Gadamer
also takes Plato and Aristotle as providing the indispensable point of
entry to an understanding of Pre-Socratic thought. When it comes to
Hegel (see Gadamer, 1971), although there is much that Gadamer finds
sympathetic to his own hermeneutic project (particularly Hegel's
attempt to move beyond the dichotomy of subject and object, as well as
aspects of Hegel's revival of ancient dialectic), Gadamer's commitment
to a hermeneutics of finitude (and so to what Hegel terms ‘bad
infinity’) places him in direct opposition to the Hegelian philosophy
of reflection that aims at totality and completion. It is with
Heidegger, however, that Gadamer had his most significant, sustained
and yet also most problematic philosophical engagement (see especially
Gadamer, 1994a). Although Gadamer emphasized the continuities between
his own work and that of Heidegger, and was clearly gratified by those
occasions when Heidegger gave his approval to Gadamer's work, he can
also be seen as involved in a subtle reworking of Heidegger's ideas. On
a number of points, that reworking has a rather different character
from that which is explicit in Heidegger. In particular, Gadamer argues
that Heidegger's attempts, in his later thinking, to find a
‘non-metaphysical’ path of thought led Heidegger into a situation in
which he experienced a ‘lack of (or need for) language’ (a
‘Sprachnot’). Gadamer's own work can thus be seen as an
attempt to take up the path of Heidegger's later thought in a way that
does not abandon, but rather attempts to work with our existing
language. Similarly, while Heidegger views the history of philosophy as
characterized by a ‘forgetting’ of being -- a forgetting that is
inaugurated by Plato -- Gadamer takes the history of philosophy to have
no such tendency. In this respect, many of the differences between
Gadamer and Heidegger become clearest in their differing readings of
the philosophical tradition, as well as in their approaches to poets
such as Hölderlin.
The engagement with literature and art has been a continuing feature
throughout Gadamer's life and work and, in particular, Gadamer has
written extensively on poets such as Celan, Goethe, Hölderlin, and
Rilke (see especially Gadamer, 1994b, 1997c). Gadamer's engagement with
art is strongly influenced by his dialogue with the history of
philosophy, and he draws explicitly on Hegel as well as Plato. At the
same time, that engagement provides an exemplification of Gadamer's
hermeneutics as well as a means to develop it further, while his
hermeneutic approach to art itself constitutes a rethinking of
aesthetics through the integration of aesthetics into hermeneutics. In
contrast to much contemporary aesthetics, Gadamer takes the experience
of beauty to be central to an understanding of the nature of art and in
the final pages of Truth and Method, he discusses the
beautiful as that which is self-evidently present to us (as ‘radiant’)
exploring also the close relationship between the beautiful and the
true. Of particular importance in his writing about art and literature
are the three ideas that appear in the subtitle to ‘The relevance of
the beautiful’ (1986b): art as play, symbol and festival. The role of
play is a central notion in Gadamer's hermeneutic thinking generally,
providing the basis for Gadamer's account of the experience both of art
and understanding (see
Aesthetics and Subjectivism
above). The symbolic character of the artwork is seen, by Gadamer, not
in terms of any form of simple ‘representationalism,’ but instead in
terms of the character of art as always showing something more than is
literally present to us in the work (this aspect of art as referring
outside itself is also taken up by Gadamer elsewhere in relation to the
character of art as ‘imitation’ -- mimesis). The artwork, no
matter what its medium, opens up, through its symbolic character, a
space in which both the world, and our own being in the world, is
brought to light as a single, but inexhaustibly rich totality. In the
experience of art, we are not merely given a ‘moment’ of vision, but
are able to ‘dwell’ along with the work in a way that takes us out of
ordinary time into what Gadamer calls ‘fulfilled’ or ‘autonomous' time.
Thus the artwork has a festive, as well as symbolic and playful
character, since the festival similarly takes us out of ordinary time,
while also opening us up to the true possibility of community.
Gadamer's emphasis on application in understanding already implies that
all understanding has a practical orientation in the sense of being
determined by our contemporary situation. Gadamer has himself engaged,
however, in more direct reflection on a range of contemporary issues
(see Gadamer 1976a, 1989a, 1993b, 1998b, 1999). Much of Gadamer's
discussion of these issues depends upon the hermeneutic ideas he has
worked out elsewhere. A central concern in many of Gadamer's essays is
the role of Europe, and European culture, in the contemporary world --
something that was especially pressing for Gadamer with the advent of
German reunification and the expansion of the European community (see
especially Gadamer, 1989a). Here, however, a number of other closely
connected issues also come into view: the nature and role of modern
science and technology (see especially, 1976a, 1998b), and together
with this, the role of the humanities; the question of education and,
in particular, of humanistic education (1992); the question of
understanding between cultures and especially between religions. In
addition, Gadamer has written on matters concerning law, ethics, the
changing character of the modern university, the connection between
philosophy and politics, and the nature of medical practice and the
concept of health (see especially Gadamer 1993b).
An extensive bibliography of Gadamer's work, compiled by Richard E.
Palmer, can be found in Hahn, 1997, 555-602; Palmer's bibliography is
essentially a simplified version of Makita, 1995.
a. Works in German
- 1985-1995, Gesammelte Werke, 10 vols., Tübingen:
J.C.B. Mohr; Truth and Method (Wahrheit und Methode:
Grundzüge einer philosophischen Hermeneutik, 5th edn, 1975),
is included as v.1; a list of contents for all 10 vols. is included in
vol.10.
- 1967-1979, Kleine Schriften, 4 vols, Tübingen:
Mohr.
Other works not included in the Gesammelte Werke or Kleine
Shriften:
- 1971, Hegels Dialektik, Tübingen: Mohr, English
trans. Gadamer 1976b.
- 1976a, Vernunft im Zeitalter der Wissenschaft:
Aufsätze, Frankfurt: Suhrkamp, English trans. Gadamer,
1981.
- 1989a, Das Erbe Europas: Beiträge, Frankfurt:
Suhrkamp, English translation in Gadamer, 1992
- 1993a, Hermeneutik, Ästhetik, Praktische Philosophie:
Hans-Georg Gadamer im Gespräch, ed. by Carsten Dutt,
Heidelberg: Universitätsverlag C. Winter, English trans. Gadamer
2001.
- 1993b, Über die Verborgenheit der Gesundheit:
Aufsätze und Vorträge, Frankfurt: Suhrkamp Verlag,
English translation Gadamer 1996.
- 1997a, Der Anfang der Philosophie, Stuttgart: Reclam,
English trans. Gadamer 1998a
- 2000, Hermeneutische Entwürfe, Tübingen: Mohr
Siebeck.
- 1976b, Hegel's Dialectic: Five Hermeneutical Studies,
trans. by P. Christopher Smith (from Gadamer, 1971), New Haven: Yale
University Press.
- 1976c, Philosophical Hermeneutics, ed. and trans. by David
E. Linge, Berkeley: University of California Press.
- 1980, Dialogue and Dialectic: Eight Hermeneutical Studies on
Plato, trans. and ed. by P. Christopher Smith, New Haven: Yale
University Press.
- 1981, Reason in the Age of Science, trans. by Frederick G.
Lawrence, Cambridge, Mass.: MIT Press.
- 1985, Philosophical Apprenticeships, trans. by Robert R.
Sullivan, Cambridge, Mass.: MIT Press.
- 1986a, The Idea of the Good in Platonic-Aristotelian
Philosophy, trans. P. Christopher Smith, New Haven: Yale
University Press.
- 1986b, The Relevance of the Beautiful and Other Essays,
trans. by N. Walker, ed. by R. Bernasconi, Cambridge: Cambridge
University Press.
- 1989b, Truth and Method, 2nd rev. edn. (1st English edn,
1975), trans. by J. Weinsheimer and D.G.Marshall, New York:
Crossroad.
- 1991, Plato's dialectical ethics: phenomenological
interpretations relating to the "Philebus", trans. by R. M.
Wallace, New Haven: Yale University Press.
- 1992, Hans-Georg Gadamer on Education, Poetry and History:
Applied Hermeneutics, ed. by Dieter Misgeld and Graeme Nicholson,
trans. by Lawrence Schmidt and Monica Ruess, Albany, NY: SUNY
Press.
- 1994a, Heidegger's ways, trans. by John W. Staley, Albany,
NY: SUNY Press.
- 1994b, Literature and Philosophy in Dialogue: Essays in German
Literary Theory, trans. By Robert H. Paslick, ed. by Dennis J.
Schmidt, Albany, NY: SUNY Press.
- 1996, The Enigma of Health: The Art of Healing in a Scientific
Age, trans. by John Gaiger and Nicholas Walker, Oxford: Polity
Press.
- 1997b, ‘Reflections on my Philosophical Journey’, trans. by Richard
E. Palmer, in Hahn (ed.), 1997.
- 1997c, Gadamer on Celan: ‘Who Am I and Who Are You?’ and Other
Essays, trans. and ed. by Richard Heinemann and Bruce Krajewski,
Albany, NY: SUNY Press.
- 1998, The Beginning of Philosophy, trans. by Rod Coltman,
New York: Continuum.
- 1998a, Praise of Theory, trans. by Chris Dawson, New
Haven: Yale University Press.
- 1999, Hermeneutics, Religion and Ethics, trans. by Joel
Weinsheimer, New Haven: Yale University Press.
- 2001, Gadamer in Conversation, trans. by Richard Palmer
(from Gadamer, 1993a), New Haven: Yale University Press.
- 2002, The Beginning of Knowledge, trans. by Rod Coltman,
New York: Continuum.
- Dostal, Robert L. (ed.), 2002, The Cambridge Companion to
Gadamer, Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
- Grondin, Jean, 2002, The Philosophy of Gadamer, trans. by
Kathryn Plant, New York: McGill-Queens University Press.
- Hahn, Lewis Edwin (ed.), 1997, The Philosophy of Hans-Georg
Gadamer, Library of Living Philosophers XXIV, Chicago:
Open Court, contains Gadamer, 1997b.
- Makita, Etsura, 1995, Gadamer-Bibliographie (1922-1994),
New York: Peter Lang (in German, this is the definitive bibliographic
source for works by and about Gadamer), for corrections and additions
to this bibliography see the entry for the ‘Gadamer Home Page’ in
‘Other Internet Resources' below.
- Malpas, Jeff, Ulrich Arnswald and Jens Kertscher (eds.), 2002,
Gadamer's Century: Essays in Honour of Hans-Georg Gadamer,
Cambridge, Mass.: MIT Press.
- Michelfelder, Diane. P. and Richard E. Palmer (eds.), 1989,
Dialogue and Deconstruction: The Gadamer-Derrida Debate,
Albany, NY: SUNY Press, contains a number of Gadamer's writings
relevant to the debate with Derrida.
- Ormiston, Gayle and Alan Schrift (eds.), 1990, The Hermeneutic
Tradition, Albany: SUNY Press, contains a number of writings by
Gadamer and others relevant to the debate with Habermas as well as
Betti.
- Scheibler, Ingrid, 2000, Gadamer. Between Heidegger and
Hermeneutics, Lanham, Maryland: Rowman and Littlefield.
- Schmidt, Lawrence K., 1985, The Epistemology of Hans-Georg
Gadamer, Frankfurt: Peter Lang.
- Silverman, Hugh J. (ed.), 1991, Gadamer and Hermeneutics,
New York: Routledge.
- Sullivan, Robert, 1990, Political Hermeneutics: The Early
Thinking of Hans-Georg Gadamer, University Park, Pennsylvania:
Pennsylvania State University Press.
- Wachterhauser, Brice, 1999, Beyond Being: Gadamer's
Post-Platonic Hermeneutic Ontology, Evanston, Illinois:
Northwestern University Press.
- Warnke, Georgia, 1987, Gadamer: Hermeneutics, Tradition and
Reason, Stanford: Stanford University Press.
- Weinsheimer, Joel, 1985, Gadamer's Hermeneutics: A Reading of
"Truth and Method", New Haven: Yale University Press.
- Wright, Kathleen (ed.), 1990, Festivals of Interpretation:
Essays on Hans-Georg Gadamer's Work, Albany, NY: SUNY Press.
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