Holes

• 1. Problems
• 2. Theories
• Bibliography
• Other Internet Resources
• Related Entries

1. Problems

‘A hole?’ the rock chewer grunted. ‘No, not a hole,’ said the will-o'-the-wisp despairingly. ‘A hole, after all, is something. This is nothing at all’. (Ende 1974/1985: 24)

Hole representations—no matter whether veridical—appear to be commonplace in human cognition. Not only do people have the impression of seeing holes; they also form a corresponding concept, which is normally lexicalised as a noun in ordinary languages. (Some languages even discriminate different types of hole, distinguishing e.g. between inner cavities and see-through perforations.) Moreover, data from developmental psychology confirm that infants are able to perceive, count, and track holes just as easily as they perceive, count, and track paradigm material objects such as cookies and tins (Giralt & Bloom 2000). These facts do not prove that holes and material objects are on equal psychological footing, let alone on equal metaphysical footing. But they indicate that the concept of a hole is of significant salience in the commonsense picture of the world, specifically of the spatio-temporal world.

If holes are entities of a kind, then, they appear to be spatio-temporal particulars, like cookies and tins and unlike numbers or moral values. They appear to have a determinate shape, a size, and a location. (‘These things have birthplaces and histories. They can change, and things can happen to them’, Hofstadter & Dennett 1981: 6-7.) On the other hand, if holes are particulars, then they are sui generis particulars. For holes are immaterial particulars—they are made of nothing, if anything is. And this gives rise to a number of conundrums. For example:

1. It is difficult to explain how holes can in fact be perceived. If perception is grounded on causation, as Locke urged (Essay, II-viii-6), and if causality has to do with materiality, then immaterial bodies cannot be the source of any causal flow. So a causal theory of perception would not apply to holes. Our impression of perceiving holes would then be a sort of systematic illusion, on pain of rejecting causal accounts of perception.
2. It is difficult to specify identity criteria for holes—more difficult than for ordinary material objects. Being immaterial, we cannot account for the identity of a hole via the identity of any constituting stuff. But neither can we rely on the identity conditions of its material "host" (the stuff around the hole), for we can imagine changing the host, partly or wholly, without affecting the hole. And we cannot rely on the identity conditions of its "guest" (the stuff inside it), for we can empty the hole of whatever might partially or fully occupy it and leave the hole intact.
3. It is difficult to assess the explanatory relevance of holes. Arguably, whenever a physical interaction can be explained by appeal to the concept of a hole, a matching explanation can be offered invoking only material objects and their properties. (That water flowed out of the bucket is explained by a number of facts about water fluidity, combined with an accurate account of the physical and geometric conditions of the bucket.) Aren't these latter explanations enough?

Further problems arise from the ambiguous status of holes in figure-ground displays (Bozzi 1975). Thus, for example, though it appears that the shape of holes can be recognized by humans as accurately as the shape of ordinary objects (Rolf & Palmer 2001), the area visually enclosed by a hole typically belongs to the background of the host, and there is evidence to the effect that background regions are not represented as having shapes (Bertamini & Croucher 2003). So what would the shape of a hole be, if any?

2. Theories

1. One could hold that holes do not exist at all, arguing that all truths about holes boil down to truths about holed objects (Jackson 1977: 32). This calls for a systematic way of paraphrasing every hole-committing sentence by means of a sentence that does not refer to or quantify over holes. For instance, the phrase ‘There is a hole in...’ can be treated as a mere grammatical variant of the shape predicate ‘... is holed’, or of the predicate ‘... has a hole-surrounding part’. (Challenge: Can a language be envisaged that contains all the necessary predicates? Can every hole-referring noun-phrase be de-nominalized? Compare: ‘The hole in the tooth was smaller than the dentist's finest probe’, Geach 1968: 12.)
2. One could hold that holes do exist, but they are not the immaterial entities they seem to be (Lewis & Lewis 1970). For instance, one could hold that holes are material after all—they are superificial parts of what, on the naive view, are their material hosts. For every hole there is a hole-surround; for every hole-surround there is a hole. On this view the hole-surround is the hole. (Challenge: This calls for an account of the altered meaning of certain predicates or prepositions. What would ‘inside’ and ‘outside’ mean? What would it mean to ‘enlarge’ a hole?)
3. Alternatively, one could hold that holes are "negative" parts of their material hosts (Hoffman & Richards 1985). On this account, a donut would be a sort of hybrid mereological aggregate—the mereological sum of a positive pie together with the negative bit in the middle. (Again, this calls for an account of the altered meaning of certain modes of speech. For instance, making a hole would amount to adding a part, and changing an object to get rid of a hole would mean to remove a part, contrary to ordinary usage.)
4. Yet another possibility is to treat holes as "disturbances" of some sort (Karmo 1977). On this view, a hole is to be found in some object (its "medium") in the same sense in which a knot may be found in a rope or a wrinkle in a carpet. (The metaphysical status of such entities, however, calls for refinements. Simons 1987: 308 has suggested construing them as Husserlian moments that continuously change their fundaments, but this seems to suit knots and wrinkles better than holes.)

On the other hand, the possibility remains of taking holes at face value. Any such effort would have to account, not only for the general features mentioned in section 1—to the effect that holes are sui generis, immaterial particulars—but also for a number of additional peculiarities (Casati & Varzi 1994). Among others:

1. Holes are localized at—but not identical with—regions of space. (Holes can move, as happens anytime you move a piece of Emmenthal cheese; regions of space cannot.)
2. Holes are ontologically parasitic: they are always in something else and cannot exist in isolation. (‘There is no such thing as a hole by itself’, Tucholsky 1930.)
3. Holes are fillable. (You don't destroy a hole by filling it up. You don't create a new hole by removing the filling.)
4. Holes are mereologically structured. (They have parts and can bear part-whole relations to one another, though not to their hosts.)
5. Holes are topologically assorted. (Superficial hollows are distinguished from internal cavities; straight perforations are distinguished from knotted tunnels.)

Bibliography

• Bertamini, M., and Croucher, C. J., 2003, ‘The Shape of Holes’, Cognition 87: 33-54.
• Bozzi, P., 1975, ‘Osservazione su alcuni casi di trasparenza fenomica realizzabili con figure a tratto’, in G. d'Arcais (ed.), Studies in Perception: Festschrift for Fabio Metelli, Milan/Florence: Martelli-Giunti, pp. 88-110.
• Casati, R., and Varzi, A. C., 1994, Holes and Other Superficialities, Cambridge, MA: MIT Press (Bradford Books).
• Ende, M., 1979, Die unendliche Geschichte: von A bis Z, Stuttgart: Thienemanns. English translation by R. Manheim: The Neverending Story, Garden City, NY: Doubleday, 1983; reprinted by Puffin Books, 1985.
• Geach, P., 1968, ‘What Actually Exists’, Proceedings of the Aristotelian Society, Suppl. Vol. 42: 7-16.
• Giralt, N., and Bloom, P., 2000, ‘How Special Are Objects? Children's Reasoning about Objects, Parts, and Holes’, Psychological Science 11: 503-507.
• Hoffman, D. D., and Richards, W. A., 1985, ‘Parts of Recognition’, Cognition 18: 65-96.
• Hofstadter, D. R., and Dennett, D. C., The Mind's I. Fantasies and Reflections on Self and Soul, New York: Basic Books.
• Jackson, F., 1977, Perception. A Representative Theory, Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
• Karmo, T., 1977, ‘Disturbances’, Analysis 37: 147-148.
• Lewis, D. K., and Lewis, S. R., 1970, ‘Holes’, Australasian Journal of Philosophy, 48: 206-212; reprinted in D. K. Lewis, Philosophical Papers. Volume 1, New York: Oxford University Press, 1983, pp. 3-9.
• Rolf, N., and Palmer, S. E., 2001, ‘Of Holes and Wholes: The Perception of Surrounded Regions’, Perception 30: 1213-1226.
• Simons, P., 1987, Parts. A Study in Ontology, Oxford: Clarendon Press.
• Tucholsky, K., 1931, ‘Zur soziologischen Psychologie der Löcher’ (signed Kaspar Hauser), Die Weltbühne, March 17, p. 389; now in Gesammelte Werke, ed. by M. Gerold-Tucholsky and F. J. Raddatz, Reinbek bei Hamburg: Rowohlt Verlag, 1960, Vol. 9, pp. 152-153. English translation by H. Zohn: ‘The Social Psychology of Holes’, in Germany? Germany! The Kurt Tucholsky Reader, Manchester: Carcanet Press, 1990, pp. 100-101.

Other Internet Resources

Related Entries

A | B | C | D | E | F | G | H | I | J | K | L | M | N | O | P | Q | R | S | T | U | V | W | X | Y | Z

Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy