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Marsilius of Inghen
Marsilius of Inghen, master at the Universities of Paris (1362-1378)
and Heidelberg (1386-1396), wrote a number of treatises on logic and
natural philosophy popular at many late medieval and early modern
universities. He adopted the logico-semantic approach of William of
Ockham and John Buridan while at the same time defending the
traditional views of Thomas Aquinas and Bonaventure. His thinking sheds
light on the discussion between nominalists and realists and allows
insight into the changing interests of philosophy and theology, from
the critical attitude of many fourteenth-century authors to the search
for tradition which was characteristic of the fifteenth century.
Marsilius of Inghen was born around 1340 in Nijmegen, a city in the
eastern part of the Low Countries (Netherlands). In the older
literature it is often said that he came from one of the villages in
the vicinity of Nijmegen (Inghen), but this view is mistaken. It was
based on a confused reading of the Oratio Funebris held in
1396 by Nicholas Prowin at the funeral of Marsilius and published in
1499 at Mainz. From 1362 on, Marsilius was master at the Faculty of
Arts at the University of Paris, where he was also rector (1367 and
1371), and a student of theology. As a teacher at Paris, Marsilius was
much esteemed and his lectures drew large audiences. Among his students
were many compatriots, some of whom came from Nijmegen and surrounding
villages. In 1378, Marsilius found himself the University's delegate at
the court of Pope Urban VI in Tivoli. In 1379, he instructed one of his
colleagues, Hugh of Hervort, to look after his interests in Paris.
After 1379, Marsilius's name is no longer mentioned in the acts of the
University of Paris. He probably turned away from Paris because of the
imbroglio surrounding the Great Schism of 1378. Meanwhile, he kept in
touch with his native city. In 1382 the town council of Nijmegen
treated him to a banquet. From 1386 on, Marsilius was master at the
University of Heidelberg. There, as in Paris, he held a number of
administrative offices. He was one of the founders of the University of
Heidelberg, of which he was rector no fewer than nine times, from
1386-1392 and also in 1396. In 1389-1390, as the University's
nuncio together with Conrad of Soltau, he was responsible for
transferring the University register to Rome (Boniface IX). At the
beginning of the 1390s, Marsilius again took up the study of theology.
The masters who taught theology were by then Conrad of Soltau (since
1387) and Matthew of Krakow (since 1394), both from the University of
Prague. In 1395/1396 Marsilius finished his lectures on the
Sentences and so became the first theologian to obtain the
doctorate at Heidelberg. He died a short time later, on August 20,
1396.
Marsilius was a prolific writer. His work was the fruit of his
teachings in Paris and Heidelberg. Many of his writings have been
preserved in manuscripts or early printed editions, although recently
some have appeared in modern critical editions. His most important
writings include:
Works on Logic and Epistemology
- Exposition of the Old Logic
- Various Questions on the Old and New Logic
- Summary [Abbreviationes] of the Old and New
Logic
- Treatises on the Properties of Terms: On Supposition,
Ampliation, Appellation, Restriction, Obligation, Insolubles, and
Consequences.
Works on Natural Philosophy and Metaphysics
- Summary [Abbreviationes] of Aristotle's
‘Physics’
- Questions on Aristotle's ‘On Generation and
Corruption’
- Questions on Aristotle's ‘De anima’
- Questions on Aristotle's ‘Metaphysics’
Works on Theology
- Questions on the ‘Sentences’ of Peter
Lombard
In his logic and epistemology, Marsilius followed the nominalist
tradition of the fourteenth century as exemplified by William of Ockham
and John Buridan. Yet Marsilius never qualified himself as a nominalist
or follower of Ockham. He was an independent thinker who sometimes went
back to the older tradition of the thirteenth century (e.g., in Peter
of Spain), or advocated theories which were more in line with ordinary
speech, as against the highly specialized views of his contemporaries.
Marsilius's nominalism comes to the fore in his views on the object
of scientific knowledge, the nature of universals, and the logical
doctrine of supposition. His basic assumption is that there are only
individuals and no universals outside the human mind.
2.1.1 The Object of Scientific Knowledge
According to the Aristotelian standard accepted by Marsilius, the
object of scientific knowledge must be universal and necessarily true.
This is not the case with individual things in the external world,
since they are subject to change. Only the conclusion of a true and
necessary syllogism can meet the standard. Hence, for Marsilius, the
object of scientific knowledge is not anything outside the mind, but
the mental proposition which refers to individual things and their
qualities. More specifically, the proper object of scientific knowledge
is a proposition in the form of a conclusion that has been deduced from
necessary premises.
2.1.2 Universals
Marsilius argued that universal concepts such as ‘humanity’
do not refer to real universals outside the human mind. Accordingly,
there is no universal essence in singular individuals. Individuals of
one genus or species do resemble each other, however, and this
resemblance is the foundation of universal concepts in the human mind.
The generation of universal concepts is a natural process, which
Marsilius described as follows: suppose individual A of species S
evokes concept X in the human mind. This concept is similar to concept
Y which has been evoked by B of the same species S. By abstracting from
all the differences between X and Y, the human mind is able to produce
another concept, Z, which stands for both A and B. Universality is then
taken to be a quality of concept Z, the product of the epistemological
operation of abstraction on concepts X and Y by the human mind.
2.1.3 Supposition
In line with his account of the nature of universals, Marsilius
rejected simple supposition. Logicians such as Peter of Spain had used
the notion to indicate that a term stood not for an individual but for
a universal or common nature in the external world, like the term
‘man’ in the proposition, ‘Man is a species’.
Since Marsilius rejected the idea of universals existing outside the
mind, he eliminated simple supposition from the list of different types
of supposition. He was critical of some of his contemporaries (e.g.,
Albert of Saxony) who likewise dismissed the concept of real
universals, yet kept on using the notion of simple supposition. They
had changed the meaning of the term, he said, by claiming that a
written or spoken term had simple supposition if it was used to refer
to a concept in the human mind. Marsilius wondered whether young
students would be able to understand this new meaning of simple
supposition, since they would hardly know what concepts are. To avoid
confusion, Marsilius decided not to deal with simple supposition at all
in his logic.
2.1.4 Some Specific Views
Marsilius was his own person when it came to assessing the views of
others. In his analysis of the proposition ‘Socrates is not a
chimera’ he followed what he called ‘the Parisian
method’, according to which the proposition is false because the
term ‘chimera’ supposits for nothing, there being no real
chimeras to which it can refer. Others, however, considered the
proposition to be true.
Elsewhere, he departed from the opinions of the Parisian School
(scola Parisiensis) and opted for the perspective of ordinary
language or common way of speaking (communis modus loquendi).
This was the case with his analysis of the proposition ‘The
Antichrist is not, but he will be’. According to the Parisian
School, the term ‘he’ refers to the thing referred to by
the term ‘Antichrist’. Since there is no Antichrist,
neither term has reference. But in ordinary language it is different,
for there the term ‘he’ is meant to refer to the future
Antichrist. Marsilius accepted the latter analysis as sound, despite
the authority of the former.
Finally, in the definition of ampliation, Marsilius went back to
logicians of the thirteenth century such as Peter of Spain, who had
defined ampliation as an extension of supposition, whereas
fourteenth-century logicians such as Albert of Saxony did not consider
ampliation to be a kind of supposition. Marsilius reinterpreted their
definition so that it fit better with the older tradition. Such efforts
to harmonize older and newer positions were typical of the late
fourteenth century.
In natural philosophy and metaphysics Marsilius was an empiricist,
meaning that he thought all scientific knowledge must be based on
either sense data or self-evident propositions, i.e., propositions in
which the meaning of the predicate is included in the subject. Everyone
who knows the meaning of the terms of such propositions judges them to
be evidently true. This has far-reaching consequences for the
relationship between philosophy and theology. Since the philosopher
uses only sense data and self-evident propositions, his inquiry may
come to different conclusion than that of the theologian, who has
additional knowledge from scripture. The philosopher makes judgments
about the world from a limited human perspective, whereas the
theologian is helped by divine revelation. Yet Marsilius took the task
of the philosopher seriously because he thought the human mind has a
natural tendency to search for truth, which is satisfied (although not
ultimately satisfied) in natural philosophy and metaphysics.
2.2.1 Creation
According to the principles of natural philosophy, creation from
nothing is impossible. The senses show that things always come from
other things. Because there is no serious reason to doubt the
information given by the senses, the human mind legitimately jumps to
the universal principle that nothing can come from nothing, driven by
the natural tendency to search for truth. Consequently, for the human
mind creation from nothing is impossible. It contradicts the universal
principle that nothing comes from nothing. That God has created the
world from nothing is therefore only a matter of faith (sola fide
est creditum). Revelation shows that human knowledge of creation
is limited, but it cannot be aided by natural philosophy at this point.
2.2.2 Theory of the Human Soul
In the later Middle Ages the study of the soul was part of natural
philosophy. Marsilius treated the human soul in his commentary on
Aristotle's De anima, in which he followed the Parisian
tradition of Buridan and Oresme concerning the particular questions
addressed. Following Buridan, he argued that there is no natural proof
of the immortality of the human soul. For the human natural mind,
unaided by revelation, the theory of Alexander of Aphrodisias that the
human soul is corruptible is the most probable. That Alexander of
Aphrodisias is mistaken and that the soul continues to exist after the
death of the body is known through revelation alone. Faith has more
authority than human reason and must be accepted in all cases where the
two conflict since the things we believe on faith come from God, who
cannot err.
Although metaphysics cannot surpass the limits of human knowledge,
Marsilius considered it to be the entry point to theology. Natural
reason is capable of forming some adequate and true concepts of God,
but also of forming true propositions about God. It is able to prove
that God exists and possesses knowledge and will. But it cannot
demonstrate that God has free will or infinite power. This, Marsilius
claimed, was also true for philosophers such as Aristotle, whose
teachings equal those of natural reason itself.
From Buridan, Marsilius took the idea that God according to
Aristotle and Averroes is not only the final cause of the heavens and
separate substances, but also their efficient cause. On this point
Buridan and Marsilius were following the view of Scotus and Ockham
against that of John of Jandun, Johannes Baconis, and Gregory of
Rimini. It is worth noting in this connection that in the Puncta
super libros Metaphysicae (i.e., brief abstracts of Aristotle's
Metaphysics for teaching purposes) attributed to Johannes de
Slupcza and written in Krakow in 1433, some of the views that Marsilius
adopted from Buridan, including the one just mentioned, are attributed
to Marsilius instead of Buridan -- notwithstanding the fact that the
author was familiar with both Marsilius's and Buridan's commentaries.
This illustrates the strong influence Marsilius's work exerted on
fifteenth-century students and commentators.
Marsilius expressed his theological views in a voluminous commentary on
the Sentences. He quoted and often adopted views that were put
forward by fourteenth-century theologians such as Adam Wodeham and
Gregory of Rimini, but was also influenced by earlier thinkers such as
Thomas Aquinas and Bonaventure. He has serious reservations about the
use of logic in theology.
2.4.1 Attributes and ideas
In his discussion of the divine attributes he followed mainly the
teachings of Adam Wodeham. God is perfectly one. Divine wisdom and all
other perfections attributed to God are in reality as identical to the
divine essence as the divine essence is identical to itself. In the
divine essence itself there is no distinction or non-identity
whatsoever between the attributes of God. Any distinctions between
divine attributes are necessarily of a rational (rather than real)
nature and are made by us.
A similarly radical stance on the unity of God was assumed in his
treatment of divine ideas. Ideas are not formally distinct in God, as
some Scotists would argue, but only extrinsically and objectively
distinct. Their distinction is a consequence of the differences between
the creatures produced by God (which is why Marsilius spoke of
extrinsic distinction), and of the fact that they are known by God as
different (which accounts for their objective distinction). God knows
that he is the cause of infinitely many differences between creatures.
That is why his mind contains infinitely many different ideas.
Marsilius criticized Ockham's view that God's idea coincides with
creation. If this were true, Marsilius argued, the idea of producing a
stone must be identical with either the stone itself, or the stone
insofar as it is known by God. If the former, then God must look
outside of himself in his idea, which contradicts the position of
Augustine, who is quoted by Ockham. If the latter, then the idea of its
production is not the stone itself, but rather God's foreknowledge of
the stone.
2.4.2 Theology and logic
Marsilius advanced his criticism of the use of logic in theology in his
discussion of the position of Robert Holcot. Holcot had argued that
logically, God can be called the cause of evil. If God is the cause of
every thing (entitas) and moral evil (malum culpae)
is a thing, then God is the cause of evil. Marsilius acknowledged that
the argument is based on true premises, yet the conclusion should not
be defended as true because it contradicts faith and therefore might
cause confusion among believers. Theologians should not flaunt their
personal skills in logic, but always write out of reverence for the
divine. Their writings should not erode the beliefs of ordinary people,
who are not skilled in logic, but rather aim to strengthen them
spiritually.
Marsilius was anxious, however, to avoid the implication that God's
foreknowledge is somehow dependent upon human beings. In his discussion
of Adam Wodeham on the causality of the human will, he complained that
Adam had not been emphatic enough on this point, since he allowed the
following argument: if an event E will happen in the future,
then God knows E from eternity; but if not-E will
happen, then God knows not-E form eternity; since man is free,
he can choose between E and not-E; therefore, he can
change God's foreknowledge. This argument is logically sound, Marsilius
argued, but it easily leads to the false conclusion that God's
knowledge depends on the free will of man, which is absurd. The eternal
cannot fall under the power of that which is created by it. Therefore,
this argument should not be used. It is better to remain on the safe
side by maintaining what has always been maintained, namely that God
through his absolute omniscience knows the future activities of human
beings, but without being dependent on them.
2.4.3 The sacraments
In his treatment of the sacraments at the end of his commentary on the
Sentences, Marsilius drew heavily on the writings of Thomas
Aquinas and Bonaventure. He defended Thomas's view that the word
‘this’ pronounced by Christ at the Last Supper in uttering
‘This is my body’ (Mk. 14:22) refers to what the bread and
body have in common. Thomas of Strasbourg had attacked this view, but
Marsilius showed that the earlier Thomas was right and the later wrong.
In his discussion of the causality of the sacraments, Marsilius
followed the exposition of Bonaventure, according to whom the
sacraments have no causality of their own. It is God who acts whenever
the sacraments are administered correctly. Only in a broad sense is it
true to say that the sacraments have the power to act.
The influence of Marsilius has been considerable, particularly through
his logical works and commentaries on Aristotle. This may be gathered
not only from the large number of manuscripts that have been preserved,
but also from several other considerations. Marsilius's commentary on
Aristotle's Prior analytics was used in Prague in the 1380s.
His logical works, including the Obligationes and the
Consequentiae, were used as textbooks in Vienna in the 1390s.
His commentaries on Aristotle's Metaphysics and
Physics were read in Krakow during the first sixty years of
the fifteenth century. At the universities of Heidelberg, Erfurt,
Basle, and Freiburg, his works were studied throughout the fifteenth
century, in particular as part of the university curriculum. In 1499,
the doctors and masters of the Via Moderna at the University
of Heidelberg published a volume that included epigrams on Marsilius by
well-known humanists such as Jacob Wimpfeling, as well as a defense of
Nominalism in the style of Marsilius (Via Marsiliana). Praise
in the form of epigrams can also be found in the 1501 Strasbourg
edition of Marsilius's commentary on the Sentences. The
Obligationes, printed in 1489 under the name of Peter of
Ailly, were used by Thomas Bricot, John Major, and Domingo de Soto. The
commentary on the Prior Analytics was quoted by Agostino Nifo.
Jodocus Trutvetter and Bartholomew of Usingen, who consolidated
nominalism in Erfurt, repeatedly mentioned Marsilius in their works.
Both Leonardo da Vinci and Galileo Galilei referred to Marsilius's
commentary on De Generatione et Corruptione.
The theological views of Marsilius appear to have had some
circulation as well. His commentary on the Sentences was known
in Krakow in the first half of the fifteenth century, and was used by
Thomas de Strampino in his Principia (1441-1442). The
University of Salamanca had a theological chair (Cátedra de
Nominales) for commentary on the works of Marsilius of Inghen and
Gabriel Biel. His commentary on the Sentences was quoted by
Spanish theologians such as Francisco de Vitoria, Domingo de Soto, Luis
de Molina, and Francisco Suárez, usually in connection with
questions about divine foreknowledge and grace.
There are nine extant manuscripts of Marsilius's commentary on the
Sentences. Among the former owners of these manuscripts were
two libraries for preachers (Ansbach and Isny), and two libraries of
faculties of arts (Erfurt and Leipzig). The education in Erfurt and
Leipzig included the reading of nominalist authors. In all probability,
the artists became interested in Marsilius's theological work after
studying his writings on logic and physics. The presence of Marsilius's
commentary on the Sentences in preachers' libraries bears
witness to the fact that the impact of his work was felt beyond
university circles.
Catalogue of works and bibliography
- Hoenen, M. J. F. M., "Marsilius von Inghen: Bibliographie. Appendix
zu der geplanten Edition der wichtigsten Werk des Marsilius von
Inghen," Bulletin de Philosophie Médiévale 31
(1989), 150-167.
- Hoenen, M. J. F. M., Marsilius von Inghen: "Bibliographie.
Ergänzungen," Bulletin de Philosophie
Médiévale 31 (1990), 191-195.
- Lohr, Ch. H., "Medieval Latin Aristotle Commentaries. Authors:
Johannes de Kanthi-Myngodus," Traditio 27 (1971),
251-351.
- Markowski, M.,"Katalog dziel Marsyliusza z Inghen z ewidencja
rekopisow," Studia Mediewistyczne 25 (1988), 39-132.
Modern editions
- Marsilius of Inghen, Quaestiones super quattuor libros
Sententiarum, vol. 1: Super primum, quaestiones 1-7, ed. G.
Wieland, M. Santos Noya, M. J. F. M. Hoenen, M. Schulze, Studies in the
History of Christian Thought 87, ed. M. Santos Noya, Leiden 2000.
- Marsilius of Inghen, Quaestiones super quattuor libros
Sententiarum, vol. 2: Super primum, quaestiones 8-21, ed. G.
Wieland, M. Santos Noya, M. J. F. M. Hoenen, M. Schulze, Studies in the
History of Christian Thought 88, ed. M. Santos Noya, Leiden 2000.
- Marsilius of Inghen, Treatises on the Properties of Terms.
A First Critical Edition of the Suppositiones, Ampliationes,
Appellationes, Restrictiones and Alienationes with Introduction,
Translation, Notes, and Appendices, ed. E. P. Bos, Synthese Historical
Library 22, Dordrecht 1983.
Secondary Literature
- Braakhuis, H. A. G., and M. J. F. M. Hoenen (eds.), Marsilius
of Inghen, Artistarium Supplementa 7, Nijmegen 1992 [contains
partial editions of works of Marsilius].
- Hoenen M. J. F. M., "Der Sentenzenkommentar des Marsilius von
Inghen (1396). Aus dem Handschriftenbestand des Tübinger
Wilhelmsstifts," Theologische Quartalschrift 171 (1991),
114-129.
- Hoenen, M. J. F. M., and P. J. J. M. Bakker (eds.), Philosophie
und Theologie des ausgehenden Mittelalters. Marsilius von Inghen und
das Denken seiner Zeit, Leiden 2000 [contains partial editions of
works of Marsilius].
- Hoenen, M. J. F. M., Marsilius of Inghen. Divine Knowledge in
Late Medieval Thought, Studies in the History of Christian Thought
50, Leiden 1993.
- Marshall P., "Parisian Psychology in the Mid-Fourteenth Century,"
Archives d'histoire doctrinale et littéraire du Moyen
Age 50 (1983), 101-193.
- Möhler W., Die Trinitätslehre des Marsilius von
Inghen. Ein Beitrag zur Geschichte der Theologie des
Spätmittelalters, Limburg/Lahn 1949.
- Reina M. E., "Comprehensio veritatis. Una questione di
Marsilio di Inghen sulla Metafisica," Filosofia e teologia nel
trecento. Studi in ricordo di Eugenio Randi, ed. L. Bianchi,
Textes et Études du Moyen Age 1, Louvain-la-Neuve 1994,
283-335.
- Ritter, G., Studien zur Spätscholastik I: Marsilius von
Inghen und die okkamistische Schule in Deutschland, Heidelberg
1921.
- Wielgus, S. (ed.), Marsilius von Inghen. Werk und Wirkung.
Akten des Zweiten Internationalen Marsilius-von-Inghen-Kongresses,
Lublin 1993 [contains partial editions of works of Marsilius].
[Please contact the author with suggestions.]
Buridan, John [Jean] |
Gregory of Rimini |
Ockham [Occam], William
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