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Questions about the nature and existence of properties are nearly as
old as philosophy itself. Interest in properties has ebbed and flowed
over the centuries, but they are now undergoing a resurgence. The last
twenty five years have seen a great deal of interesting work on
properties, and this entry will focus primarily on that work (thus
taking up where Loux's (1972) earlier review of the literature leaves
off).
When we turn to the recent literature on properties we find a
confusing array of terminology, incompatible standards for evaluating
theories of properties, and philosophers talking past one another. It
will be easier to follow this literature if we begin by focusing on the
point of introducing properties in the first place.
Philosophers who argue that properties exist almost always do so
because they think properties are needed to solve certain philosophical
problems, and their views about the nature of properties are
strongly influenced by the problems they think properties are needed to
solve. So the discussion here will be organized around the tasks
properties have been introduced to perform and the ways in which these
tasks influence accounts of the nature of properties.
In §1 I introduce some distinctions and terminology that will
be useful in subsequent discussion. The tasks properties are called on
to perform are typically explanatory, and so §2 contains
a brief discussion of explanation in ontology. §3 contains a
discussion of traditional attempts to use properties to explain
phenomena in metaphysics, epistemology, philosophy of language, and
ethics. §4 focuses on the three areas where contemporary
philosophers have offered the most detailed accounts based on
properties: philosophy of mathematics, the semantics of natural
languages, and topics in a more nebulous area that might be called
naturalistic ontology. We then turn to issues about the nature
of properties, including their existence conditions (§5), their
identity conditions (§6), and the various sorts of properties
there might be (§7). §8 provides an introductory, informal
discussion of formal theories of properties. After §2 the
sections, and in many cases the subsections, are relatively modular,
and readers can use the
detailed tables of contents
and hyperlinks to locate those topics that interest them
most.
[Detailed Table of Contents (to subsection level)]
[More Detailed Table of Contents (to subsubsection level)
]
Properties include the attributes or qualities or features or
characteristics of things. Issues in ontology are so vexed that even
those philosophers who agree that properties exist often disagree about
which properties there are. This means that there are no
wholly uncontroversial examples of properties, but likely candidates
include the color and rest mass of the apple on my desk, as well (more
controversially) as the properties of being an apple and
being a desk. For generality we will also take properties to
include relations like being taller than and lying
between.
A fundamental question about properties — second only in
importance to the question whether there are any — is whether
they are universals or particulars. To say that properties are
universals is to say that the selfsame property can be instantiated by
numerically distinct things. On this view it is possible for two
different apples to exemplify exactly the same color, a single
universal. The competing view is that properties are just as much
individuals or particulars as the things that have them. No matter how
similar the colors of the two apples, their colors are numerically
distinct properties, the redness of the first apple and the redness of
the second. Such individualized properties are variously known as
‘perfect particulars’, ‘abstract particulars’,
‘quality instances’, ‘moments’, and
‘tropes’.
Tropes
have various
attractions and liabilities, but since they are the topic of another
entry, we will construe properties (save for any, perhaps those like
being identical with Socrates, that could only be exemplified
by one thing) as universals.
Properties are sometimes distinguished from relations. For example, a
specific shade of red or a rest mass of 3 kilograms is a property,
while being smaller than or having a weight of 29.4
newtons are typically regarded as relations (both of which relate
my laptop computer to the Earth).
Relations
generate a few special problems of their own, but for the most part
properties and relations raise the same philosophical issues and,
except where otherwise noted, I will use ‘property’ as a
generic term to cover both monadic (one-place, nonrelational)
properties and (polyadic, multi-place) relations.
Properties are most naturally contrasted with particulars, i.e., with
individual things. The fundamental difference between properties and
individuals is that properties can be instantiated or
exemplified, whereas individuals cannot. Furthermore, at least
many properties are general; they can be instantiated by more
than one thing.
The things that exemplify a property are called instances
of it (the instances of a relation are the things, taken in the
relevant order, that stand in that relation). It is a matter of
controversy whether properties can exist without actually being
exemplified and whether some properties can be exemplified by other
properties (in the way, perhaps, that redness exemplifies the
property of being a color). Some philosophers even hold that
there are unexemplifiable properties, e.g., being red and not
red, but even they typically believe that such properties are
intimately related to other properties (here being red and
not being red) that can be exemplified.
The deepest question about properties is whether there are any.
Textbooks feature a triumvirate of answers: realism,
nominalism, and conceptualism. There are many species
of each view, but the rough distinctions come to this. Realists hold
that there are universal properties. Nominalists deny this (though some
hold that there are tropes). And conceptualists urge that words (like
‘honesty’) which might seem to refer to properties really
refer to concepts. A few contemporary philosophers have defended
conceptualism (cf. Cocchiarella, 1986, ch. 3), and recent empirical
work on concepts bears on it. It is not a common view nowadays,
however, and I will focus on realism here.
Just a few decades ago many philosophers concurred with Quine's
dismissal of properties as "creatures of darkness," but philosophers
now widely invoke them without guilt or shame. For example, most
current discussions of mental causation are couched in terms of the
causal efficacy of mental properties, while discussions of
supervenience often proceed by way of a claim that one family of
properties (e.g., mental properties) is supervenient on some other
family of properties (e.g., physical properties). But the resurgence of
interest in properties has left us with widely varying accounts of
their nature, and questions about their existence have by no means
disappeared.
It is possible to classify theories of properties in terms of their
characterizations of the nature of properties or in
terms of the jobs they introduce properties to do. The former
kind of characterization is more fundamental, but since views about the
nature of properties are typically motivated by accounts of the work
properties are invoked to do, it will be more useful to begin with the
latter. We will ask what explanatory roles properties have
been introduced to fill, and we will then try to determine what
something would have to be like in order to occupy
those roles. This will also allow us to consider the sorts of arguments
that are typically advanced for the claim that properties exist.
Philosophers do not have a settled idiom for talking about properties.
Often they make do with a simple distinction between singular terms and
predicates. Singular terms are words and phrases (like proper names and
definite descriptions) that can occupy subject positions in sentences
and that purport to denote or refer to a single thing. Examples include
‘Bill Clinton,’ ‘Chicago’, and ‘The first
female Supreme Court Justice’. Predicates, by contrast, can be
true of things. When we represent a sentence like ‘Quine is a
philosopher’ in a standard formal language (like first-order
logic) as ‘Pq’, we absorb the entire expression
‘is a philosopher’ into the predicate
‘P’ (though for some theoretical purposes it is
more useful to count ‘philosopher’ or even ‘a
philosopher’ as the predicate). The notion of a predicate is
supplanted by the notion of a verb phrase in modern grammars, so we
don't need to pursue this issue here, but we can raise our first
question about property talk at this relatively atheoretical level.
It is perfectly grammatical to say ‘Monica is honest’ or
‘Honesty is a virtue’, but your old English teacher will
cringe if you say ‘Honest is a virtue’ or ‘Monica is
honesty’. We must use ‘honest’ after the
‘Monica is’, and we have to use the nominalization,
‘honesty’, before ‘is a virtue’. The fact that
‘honest’ and ‘honesty’ cannot be interchanged
without destroying the grammaticality of our original sentences has
been thought to have various philosophical morals. Some philosophers
take it to show that the two expressions cannot stand for the same
thing; for example, ‘honest’ might stand for a property and
‘honesty’ might stand for a property-correlate of some sort
(Frege draws roughly this moral from his discussion of ‘the
concept horse’). Others take it to show that although both
expressions are related to the same thing, the property
honesty, they are related to by different semantic relations;
for example, the nominalization denotes this property, whereas the
predicate expresses it.
Frege's argument for the first sort of view is not compelling (see
Parsons, 1986, for a good discussion); moreover, it would be desirable
to avoid multiplying entities (e.g., property correlates) and semantic
relations (e.g., expression) beyond necessity. And mere failures of
substitutivity are not enough to show that they are necessary, since
various syntactic features of sentences prohibit the exchange of terms
that are clearly co-referential. Consider case forms of personal
pronouns: ‘I’ and ‘me’ cannot be exchanged
(without destroying grammaticality) in sentences like ‘I
dropped the hammer, and he returned it to me’. But no
one concludes that distinct objects (me and a me-correlate) or distinct
semantic relations (nominative-case reference and accusative-case
reference) are needed to account for this.
The multiplicity of ways of talking about properties can be obscured
when we use familiar formal languages to represent them. The
constructions verb (‘lives’), verb + adverb (‘sings
badly’), copula + adjective (‘is red’), copula +
determiner + common noun (‘is a dog’), copula + noun phrase
(‘is a Republican President), and (if Davidson's account of
events is correct) even adverbs (‘slowly’) and
prepositional phrases (‘in the bathroom’) all go over into
the familiar ‘F’s and ‘G’s of
standard logical notation. The fact that these expressions can often be
handled in the same way without too much violence tells us that they
have certain similarities, but there are also many differences, and
some of them may turn out to be relevant to ontology.
The complexities involving property words are even greater when we turn
to singular terms. We can form singular terms from predicative
expressions in many ways (different ways are appropriate for different
predicates). To begin with, English contains a plethora of
suffixes that we can append to predicative expressions
(sometimes after minor surgery on the original) to form singular terms.
These include ‘-hood’ (‘motherhood,
‘falsehood), ‘-ness’ (‘drunkeness’,
‘betweeness’), ‘-ity’
(‘triangularity’, ‘solubility’,
‘stupidity’), ‘-kind’ (‘mankind’),
‘-ship’ (‘friendship’,
‘brinksmanship’), ‘ing’ (‘walking’,
‘loving’), ‘ment’ (‘commitment’,
‘judgment’), ‘cy’ (‘decency’,
‘leniency’), and more.
Various philosophical terms of art serve a similar purpose. The word
‘itself’ plays this role in some translations of Plato
(‘The equal itself’, ‘Justice itself’), and
contemporary authors use phrases like ‘the property red’,
‘the property of being red’, and ‘the causal
relation’ to much the same end. Various gerundive phrases (e.g.,
‘being red’ and ‘being a red thing’) and
infinitive phrases (‘to be happy’, ‘to be someone who
is happy’) work in a similar way. Finally, there are many less
systematic ways of talking about properties; for example, we can use a
definite description that a property just happens to satisfy
(‘the color of my true love's hair’, ‘John's favorite
four-place relation’).
The expressions formed in these ways occupy subject positions in
sentences where they seem to denote to properties. It is worth noting,
however, that it is often impossible to substitute some of these
expressions for related ones without destroying the grammaticality or,
in some cases, without altering the truth value of the original
sentence. Consider ‘wisdom’, ‘being wise’,
‘the property of being wise’, and ‘to be wise’.
‘Wisdom is a virtue’ is unexceptionable, but ‘Being
wise is a virtue’ is shaky at best. On the other hand, ‘To
be wise is to be virtuous’ and ‘Being wise is a good
thing’ are fine, but ‘Wisdom is to be virtuous’
clearly won't do. And ‘The property of being wise is a good
thing’ is grammatical, but has a different meaning from
‘Being wise is a good thing’.
The phenomenon of case shows that lack of substitutivity alone
doesn't have deep ontological consequences, but it is quite possible
that the sorts of phenomena noted in the previous paragraph signal
important differences in ontology. Some of these differences might
begin to emerge from informal probing, but we cannot expect to settle
such matters without detailed, philosophically-sensitive syntactic and
semantic theories that are better supported than their rivals. Such
theories do not yet exist, and so here I will be fairly cavalier about
"property terms," using various phrases, e.g., ‘redness’
and ‘the property of being red’ indifferently to refer to
the same property. But this expedient is not meant to suggest that
subtle grammatical differences won't eventually turn out to have
important ontological implications.
Properties are typically introduced to help explain or
account for phenomena of philosophical interest. The existence
of properties, we are told, would explain qualitative recurrence or
help account for our ability to agree about the instances of general
terms like ‘red’. In the terminologies of bygone eras,
properties save the phenomena; they afford a fundamentum in re
for things like the applicability of general terms. Nowadays
philosophers make a similar point when they argue that some phenomenon
holds because of or in virtue of this or that
property, that a property is its foundation or ground
for it, or that a property is the truth maker for a sentence
about it. These expressions signify explanations.
When properties are introduced to help explain certain
philosophically puzzling phenomena, we have a principled way to learn
what properties are like: since they are invoked to play
certain explanatory roles, we can ask what they would
have to be like in order to play the roles they are introduced
to fill. What, for example, would their existence or identity
conditions need to be for them to explain the (putative) modal features
of natural laws or the a priori status of mathematical
truths?
Perhaps the deepest question in ontology is when (if ever) it is
legitimate to postulate the existence of entities (like possible
worlds, facts, or properties) that are not evident in experience. Some
philosophers insist that it never is. Others urge that at least some
entities of this sort, in particular properties, have no explanatory
power and that appeals to them are vacuous or otherwise illegitimate
(e.g., Quine, 1961, p. 10; Quinton 1973, p. 295).
The more heavy-handed dismissals of properties and other
metaphysical creatures have often been based on faulty accounts of
concept formation (which led Hume to counsel consignment of
metaphysical works to the flames) or defective theories of meaning
(which led many positivists to view metaphysics as a series of pseudo
explanations offered to solve pseudo problems). Wittgenstein takes a
more subtle approach, trying to show us that ‘our disease is one
of wanting explanations’ (1991, Pt VI, 31) and striving to cure
us of it. Swoyer (1999) has attempted some defense of explanation by
postulation in ontology, but the issues are difficult ones that are not
amenable to proof or disproof. Fortunately the present task is not to
defend explanation in ontology, but it will be useful to briefly note
two general views about such explanations.
Metaphysics has traditionally been viewed as first philosophy, and some
philosophers hold that its arguments should be demonstrative. Recently
Linsky & Zalta (1995) have argued that it is possible to give a
transcendental argument for the existence of properties; if this
argument is successful, it is demonstrative, and they claim that its
conclusion (that a wide range of properties exist) is synthetic a
priori. Others (e.g., Swoyer, 1983; 1999) urge that most of the
arguments advanced on behalf of properties appear anemic when judged by
the demonstrative ideal, but that they look much better when viewed as
inferences to the best explanations. We will not pursue this issue,
however, since it is impossible to form a satisfactory view about the
nature of philosophical explanations in a vacuum. An account of
metaphysical explanation should instead emerge from a consideration of
the more plausible metaphysical explanations, and we will focus on such
explanations here.
Philosophical explanations are usually thought to be constrained in
various ways, but beyond philosophical family values like consistency,
parsimony and comprehensiveness these constraints will often seem
parochial to those philosophers who are not committed to them. In
Medieval disputations about universals, for example, religion and
theology were fundamental, and it was widely held that any account of
properties should be able to explain the Trinity, the Eucharist, and
the absolutely unchanging nature of God (this last requirement often
led to quite tortured accounts of the relations holding between protean
finite beings and God). But few philosophers in our naturalistic era
would give such considerations a second thought.
Some proposed constraints on metaphysical explanation depend on more
general philosophical orientations. For example, Russell's Principle of
Acquaintance, the injunction that we only admit items into our ontology
if we are directly acquainted with them, expresses an strong empiricist
sentiment. Other constraints are more directly metaphysical. For
example, Aristotle upbraids Plato for separating the Forms from their
instances, suggesting that this renders them incapable of explaining
anything (e.g., Metaphysics,1079b11-1080a10). His point seems
to be that properties could explain things about individuals only if
they were located in those individuals. The sentiment is that
an individual, spatio-temporal object (like my cat) which stands in
some obscure relation to some entity entirely outside of space and time
(say the Form of the cat) cannot explain anything about the cat itself.
All accounts of properties must avoid various perennial objections to
them. Three criticisms of this sort were anticipated by Plato (worrying
about his own doctrines) in the Parmenides.
First, it appears that a universal property can be in two completely
different places (i.e., in two different instances) at the same time,
but ordinary things can never be separated from themselves in this way.
There are scattered individuals (like the former British Empire), but
they have different spatial parts in different places. Properties, by
contrast, do not seem to have spatial parts; indeed, they are sometimes
said to be wholly-present in each of their instances. But how could a
single thing be wholly present in widely separated locations?
This conundrum has worried some philosophers so much that they have
opted for an ontology of tropes in order to avoid it, but realists have
two lines of reply (both of which commit us to fairly definite views
about the nature of properties). One response is that properties are
not located in their instances (or anywhere else), so they are never
located in two places at once. The other response is that this
objection wrongly judges properties by standards that are only
appropriate for individuals. Properties are a very different sort of
entity, and they can exist in more than one place at the same
time without needing spatial parts to do so.
Second, some properties seem to exemplify themselves. For example,
if properties are abstract objects, then the property of being abstract
should itself exemplify the property of being abstract. In various
passages throughout his dialogues Plato appears to hold that Forms
(which are often taken to be his version of properties) participate in
themselves. Indeed, this claim serves as a premise in what is known as
his Third-Man Argument which, he seems to think, may show that
the very notion of a Form is incoherent (Parmenides,
132ff).
Russell's paradox
raises more serious
worries about self-exemplification. It shows that any account which
allows properties to exemplify themselves must be carefully formulated
if it is to avoid paradox (a polite word for inconsistency).
Third, many critics have charged that properties generate vicious
regresses, e.g., the one exhibited in Plato's third man argument or
Bradley's regress,
and any viable account of
properties must have the resources to avoid them.
The disputes about plausible constraints on property-invoking
explanations, together with the obvious difficulty of settling such
disputes, leave the situation murkier than we would wish. We will see
that the use of properties to explain phenomena in the philosophy of
mathematics or naturalistic ontology or the semantics of natural
languages imposes additional, tighter, constraints that make it easier
to evaluate competing accounts. But constraints of the sort noted here
have played a central role in many philosophical discussions of
properties, and we will often fail to understand those discussions if
we forget this.
Metaphysics, like life, is full of tradeoffs, cost-benefit analyses,
the attempt to simultaneously satisfy competing constraints. In
ontology we must frequently weigh tradeoffs between various desiderata,
e.g., between simplicity and comprehensiveness, and even between
different kinds of simplicity. But one tradeoff is so pervasive that it
deserves a name, and I will call it the fundamental ontological
tradeoff. The fundamental ontological tradeoff reflects the
perennial tension between explanatory power and epistemic risk, between
a rich, lavish ontology that promises to explain a great deal and a
more modest ontology that promises epistemological security. The more
machinery we postulate, the more we might hope to explain — but
the harder it is to believe in the existence of all the machinery.
The dialectic between a realism with chutzpah and a diffident
empiricism runs all through philosophy, from ethics to philosophy of
science to philosophy of mathematics to metaphysics. Excessive versions
of each view are usually unappealing. Extreme realists ask us to
believe in things many philosophers find it difficult to believe in;
extreme empiricists wind up unable to explain much of anything. But the
dialectic between power and risk remains even when we move in from the
extremes. It often manifests itself in a yearning for parsimony, a
desire for as few entities as we can scrimp by with. Such longings may
seem prudish or stuffy or a bit too metaphysically correct. Often the
desire is not to achieve parsimony for its own sake, however, but to
find an ontology that is modest enough to provide a measure of
epistemological security. Choices needn't be all or none, and a
principled middle ground is always worth striving for. But no matter
where a philosopher tries to stake her claim, the fundamental
ontological tradeoff can rarely be avoided and we will encounter it
frequently in what follows.
Properties have been invoked to explain a very wide range of phenomena.
The things to be explained (explananda; singular
explanandum) are a mixed bag, and the explanations vary
greatly in plausibility. To fix ideas, we will note several of the most
common explanations philosophers have asked properties to provide (for
a longer list see Swoyer, 1999, §3).
There are objective similarities or groupings in the world. Some things
are alike in certain ways. They have the same color or shape or size;
they are protons or lemons or central processing units. A puzzle,
sometimes called the problem of the One over the Many, asks
for an account of this. Possession of a common property (e.g., a given
shade of yellow) or a common constellation of properties (e.g., those
essential to lemons) has often been cited to explain such resemblance.
Similarly, different groups of things, e.g., Bill and Hillary, George
and Barbara, can be related in similar ways, and the postulation of a
relation (here being married to) that each pair jointly
instantiates is often cited to explain this similarity. Finally, having
different properties, e.g., different colors, is often said to explain
qualitative differences. A desire to explain qualitative similarity and
qualitative difference has been a traditional motivation for realism
with respect to universals, and it continues to motivate many realists
today (e.g., Armstrong, 1984, p 250; Butchvarov, 1966; Aaron, 1967, ch.
9).
Many organisms easily recognize and classify newly encountered objects
as yellow or round or lemons or rocks, they can recognize that one new
thing is larger than a second, and so on. Some philosophers have urged
that this ability is based partly on the fact that the novel instances
have a property that the organism has encountered before — the
old and new cases share a common property — and that the creature
is somehow attuned to recognize it.
Our ability to use general terms (like ‘yellow,
‘lemon’, ‘heavier than’, ‘between’)
provides a linguistic counterpart to the epistemological phenomenon of
recognition and to the metaphysical problem of the One over the Many.
Most general terms apply to some things but not to others, and in many
cases competent speakers have little trouble knowing when they apply
and when they do not. Philosophers have often argued that possession of
a common property (like redness), together with certain
linguistic conventions, explains why general terms apply to the things
that they do. For example Plato noted that ‘we are in the habit
of postulating one unique Form for each plurality of objects to which
we apply a common name’ (Republic, 596A; see also
Phaedo 78e, Timaeus, 52a, Parmenides, 13;
Russell, Problems of Philosophy, p. 93). Questions about the
meanings (now often known as the ‘semantic values’) of
singular terms like ‘honesty’ and ‘hunger’ and
‘being in love’ may be even more pressing, since the chief
task of such terms seems to be to refer to things. But what
could a word like ‘honesty’ refer to? If there are
properties, it could refer to the property honesty.
In a brilliant paper on Plato's theory of Forms (which, as noted above,
are often taken to be his version of properties), the classicist H. F.
Cherniss (1936) argues that Plato intended his theory to solve three
fundamental philosophical problems. By the end of the fifth century
B.C. the arguments and conundrums of philosophers had cast doubt on
several things that Plato thought were obviously true. In ethics
Protagorean relativism threatened the view that ethical principles
could be objective; in the clamor of individual disagreements, clashes
between cultures, and the failure of philosophical inquiry to locate
any firm ground, the challenge was to explain how ethical
objectivity was possible. When Plato turned to epistemology, various
considerations convinced him that there was an important difference
between knowledge (episteme) and belief (doxa), even
between knowledge and true belief (right opinion). But how
could we explain that? Finally, in metaphysics it seemed clear that
things change in various ways, but the arguments of Parmenides made
even this seem mysterious.
Plato drew on his Forms to explain how these three phenomena were
possible. On his view, the Forms exist pure and unadulterated by human
thought, and some Forms, most prominently the Good, offer objective
standards for values like goodness and justice. In epistemology Plato
attempted to explain the difference between knowledge and belief by
arguing that Forms are the objects of the former but not the latter
(e.g., Timaeus, 51d3ff). In metaphysics Plato argued that
change is only possible against a background of things that do not
change, and he urged that the Forms provided this (Cratylus,
439d3ff). Finally, although Cherniss doesn't mention it, Plato's theory
of Forms helped explain the semantics of general terms (as suggested in
Republic, 596A).
This isn't to say that all, or indeed any, of Plato's explanations
were successful. But it is worth noting that many philosophers still
invoke properties to account for the sorts of things Plato struggled to
explain. Early in this century G. E. Moore offered an alternative to
ethical naturalism by claiming that goodness is a simple, non-natural
property. Few contemporary philosophers would accept Moore's
anti-naturalism or his account of non-natural properties, but many
would defend ethical naturalism by arguing that moral properties
supervene on naturalistically respectable properties.
Virtually no philosophers accept Plato's account of the difference
between knowledge and belief, but many still hold that properties have
an important role to play in explaining epistemological phenomena. For
example, Russell (1912, ch. 10) argued that the only way to explain the
possibility of a priori knowledge is to regard it as knowledge
of relations among universals . Most philosophers today would question
this, but many of them would agree that properties have an important
role to play in explaining such epistemological phenomena as our
ability to recognize and categorize things in the world around us.
Few contemporary philosophers would endorse Plato's claims about the
need for some permanent backdrop for flux, but properties can still be
cited to explain change. If my pet chameleon was brown all over
yesterday and is green all over today, then the brute existence of the
creature isn't enough to explain the change; after all, he
persisted throughout. But, some philosophers urge, we can explain the
alteration by noting that the chameleon exemplified the property
brownness yesterday but he exemplifies the property
greenness today.
Finally, many philosophers would concur that Plato's account of the
meanings of general terms was on the right track, though as we shall
see in
§4.2,
current accounts of meaning
have moved far beyond Plato's in their detail and formal
sophistication.
This brief survey of putative explanations that rely on properties
isn't meant to be detailed or exhaustive; the point is simply to
illustrate how a range of accounts employ properties in an effort to
explain philosophically puzzling phenomena. Just as importantly,
Plato's account suggests an attractive model for philosophical
explanation. A general pattern of explanation by unification,
integration or systematization is at work in his
attempt to solve three, superficially disparate, problems using the
same resources. He attempts to show that at a fundamental level the
three phenomena are related, linked by the Forms and the principles
than govern them. This unification has explanatory value, since it
allows us to see a single pattern or entity at work in a range of
superficially diverse cases. At all events, this is one explanatory
virtue in the natural sciences, clearly at work in the work of Newton
and Maxwell and Darwin, and it is also a pattern we find in Plato's
account.
An account that employs properties to do multiple tasks has two
further virtues. First, insofar as each of the explanations is
plausible, it serves as part of a cumulative case for the
existence of properties. Second, if properties can perform multiple
tasks, they must simultaneously satisfy multiple constraints, and so
different sorts of data can be used to test a theory of properties. The
hope is that by considering several tasks of this sort we could begin
to triangulate in on the nature of properties; we could begin to see
what features properties would need to have in order to play each of
the different explanatory roles. It may turn out, of course, that
entities well-suited to one explanatory role will be ill-suited to
another. For example, we will see below that the existence and identity
conditions of entities used to account for causation may be rather
different from those needed by entities that could serve as the
meanings of intentional idioms (like ‘is thinking of
Vienna’). This might lead us to postulate the existence of
several kinds of properties; alternatively, it might lead us to
conclude that properties cannot do all of the things philosophers has
hoped that they could. Either way, as fragmentation increases,
cumulative support and triangulation on the nature of properties will
slip away.
Properties alone cannot explain much of anything. A theory of
properties — an account that tells us what properties are
like and how they do what they are invoked to do
— is required for that. A number of theories of properties have
been developed over the last quarter century, and many of them possess
much more depth, sophistication, and formal detail than the no-frills
accounts alluded to in the previous section. I will focus on
explanations in three areas where properties are often invoked today:
philosophy of mathematics, semantics (the theory of meaning), and
naturalistic ontology. These areas are also useful to consider, because
if properties can explain things of interest to philosophers who don't
specialize in metaphysics, things like mathematical truth or the nature
of natural laws, then properties will seem more interesting. Unlike the
substantial forms derided by early modern philosophers as dormitive
virtues, properties will pay their way by doing interesting and
important work.
My aim is to indicate the general lay of the land and point the way
to more detailed discussions that interested readers can follow up. In
each of the three cases I will indicate:
- What is to be explained. As with most things in
philosophy, there is often some controversy over which things in a
given area stand in need of philosophical explanation. In some cases a
few philosophers question the very existence of the things that other
philosophers think require explanation; for example, able philosophers
have denied that there are such things as mathematical truth (e.g.,
Field, 1980) or laws of nature (e.g., van Fraassen, 1989). And even
those philosophers who think that we need to explain certain things,
e.g., various features of mathematical truth, may disagree about
precisely what those features are. In the three areas examined in this
section, however, there is a reasonable degree of consensus about which
things stand in need of explanation, and I will focus on these.
- How properties explain. In some cases different
philosophers use properties in different ways to explain the same
phenomenon. I will focus on the simpler, more common approaches. We
will also see that in most cases a theory of properties only explains
things when it is conjoined with various background assumptions or
auxiliary hypotheses.
- Beating the competition. Arguments that properties
exist because they explain some particular phenomenon (like qualitative
recurrence or mathematical truth) are weak if other sorts of entities
can account for it just as well. Arguments that alternative accounts
don't work, especially when they involve alternative putative entities
(like sets or tropes), are typically based on the claim that these
entities lack the requisite features to account for the explanandum. I
will also note a few cases where proponents of one account of
properties argue against proponents of a rival account, since these
arguments typically involve disputes over the nature of
properties.
- Difficulties. Almost all explanations that employ
properties face difficulties, and I will briefly indicate the most
serious of these.
- Lessons the explanations teach us about
properties. Properties often must have certain features in
order to provide certain explanations. So once we have examined a given
explanation, we will ask what properties would have to be like
in order to provide it. In particular, we will ask what lessons are to
be learned about the existence and identity conditions of properties,
their structure (if any), and their modal and epistemic status.
Philosophers of mathematics have focused much (arguably too much) of
their attention on number theory (arithmetic). Number theory is just
the theory of the natural numbers, 0, 1, 2, ..., and the familiar
operations (like addition and multiplication) on them. Many sentences
of arithmetic, e.g., ‘7 + 5 = 12’ certainly seem to be
true, but such truths present various philosophical puzzles and
philosophers have tried to explain how they could have the
features they seem to have.
Most wish lists include hopes for explanations of at least five
(putative) facts; philosophers want to know:
- How the sentences of arithmetic can have truth values (how they can
be true or false)
- How the sentences of arithmetic can be objectively true (or false),
independently of human language and thought
- What the logical forms of the sentences of arithmetic are
- How the sentences of arithmetic can be necessarily true (or
necessarily false)
- How the truth values of sentences of arithmetic can be known
independently of experience (a priori), save for a modicum of
experience needed to acquire mathematical concepts
Most attempts to use properties to explain the items on this list are
versions of identificationism, the reductionist strategy that
identifies numbers with things that initially seem to be
different. This approach is familiar from the original versions of
identificationism where numbers were identified with sets, but it is
straightforward to adapt this earlier work to identify numbers with
properties rather than with sets.
Sets are often contrasted with properties, and before proceeding it is
important to note a fundamental difference between the two. If
x and y are sets and have exactly the same members,
then x and y are one and the same set. When
x and y have precisely the same members they are said
to have the same extension, and sets are often called
extensional entities. Just as sets can have members,
properties can have instances, things that exemplify or instantiate
them, and this relation of exemplification is to properties what the
membership relation is to sets.
The identity conditions of properties are a matter of dispute.
Everyone who believes there are properties at all, however, agrees that
numerically distinct properties can have exactly the same
instances without being identical. Even if it turns out that exactly
the same things exemplify a given shade of green and circularity, these
two properties are still distinct. For this reason properties are often
said to be intensional entities, although people often concur
with this because they agree about what properties' identity conditions
are not (they aren't extensional), rather than because they
agree about what their identity conditions are.
If we have a rich enough theory of properties, it is possible to
retrace the steps of earlier versions of identificationism using
properties in place of sets. The property theorist can formulate axioms
for property theory that parallel the axioms of standard set theories
(save for replacing the axiom of extensionality with some other
identity condition, perhaps omitting the axiom of foundations, and
making other minor emendations to adapt the ideas better to properties;
e.g., Jubien, 1989; cf. Bealer, 1982, Ch. 6; Pollard and Martin, 1986).
There are infinitely many natural numbers (the collection of natural
numbers in fact has the smallest size an infinite collection can have),
so the first step in identificationist programs is to find (or
postulate, or imagine) an infinite realm of properties. The next step
is to identify one denizen of this realm with the number zero and to
identify some operation on this realm of entities with the successor
function. The key here is that successive iterations of the function
yield a new and different entity every time it's applied.
There are two major species of identificationism. The first views
the reducing theory (of sets, or of properties) as a branch of logic;
the second views it as a substantive theory (of sets, or of properties)
that makes commitments over and above those made by logic. There are
important differences between the two approaches, but given the very
strong nature of the logic required for logicist identificationism, the
differences do not matter greatly here so I will treat both approaches
together. (For a discussion of the differences, see Section 1
("Logicist Identificationism") of the supplementary document
Uses of Properties in the Philosophy of Mathematics.)
Identificationist accounts treat ‘1’ and ‘2’
as singular terms that refer to properties (those properties that are
identified as the numbers 1 and 2), and they treat predicates and
function symbols as denoting relations and functions. Thus, since the
semantics values of ‘1’ and ‘2’ are in the
extension of the relation expressed by the predicate
‘<’, the sentence ‘1 < 2’ is true and,
indeed, it has the simple logical form of a predication of a two-place
predicate, ‘<’, with two singular terms, ‘1’
and ‘2’, i.e., it has the simple logical form Rxy.
We apply this idea to all atomic sentences in the language of
arithmetic and then extend the account to all sentences in this
language by the usual recursive treatments of the logical
constants.
This explains how sentences of arithmetic can be objectively true
(wishes 1 and 2): they are true because they describe an objective
realm of mind-independent properties. And since the language we use has
a straightforward referential semantics, it also supplies a very
natural and straightforward account of the logical forms of the
sentences of number theory (wish 3). Finally, if the properties
identified with numbers are ones that exist necessarily, and if they
necessarily stand in the arithmetical relations that they do, the
truths of arithmetic will be necessarily true (wish 4). But taken alone
property-based identificationism does not explain mathematical
knowledge (wish 5; we will return to this matter
below).
Some recent accounts identify numbers with properties that seem less
other-worldly than those invoked by mainstream identificationists. For
example, Bigelow and Pargetter (1990) argue that rational numbers are
higher-order relations — ratios — among certain
kinds of first-order relations. The leading idea is that if Bill is
twice as tall as Sam, then Bill stands in the relation twice as
tall to Sam. This relation in turn stands in the (second-order)
ratio relation of 2:1 to the identity relation among objects. Such
higher-order ratio relations are isomorphic to the rational numbers,
and Bigelow and Pargetter go on to identify them with the
rational numbers. Thus, the second-order relation 5:1 turns out to be
the number five. It isn't clear how to extend the ideas to large
infinite cardinals or to ordinal numbers, but they propose extending
the idea to second-order relations of proportion, and identifying the
reals with such proportions.
There are also several non-identificationist accounts of mathematical
truth that make use of properties.
The most important features, perhaps the only features, of the natural
numbers are structural ones. These are the features that
axiomatizations capture (zero is the first member of a countably
infinite sequence, each member of the sequence has exactly one member
that follows it, etc.). Such sequences are said to be omega-sequences.
Structuralists (often inspired by Benacerraf, 1965) take this idea to
heart and argue that any omega-sequence can play the role of the
natural numbers (cf. Resnik, 1995). They claim that it's the
structure that such sequences have in common, rather than the
particular entities that happen to populate them, that are important
for mathematics. And one way to develop this idea is to think of an
omega-sequence as a very complex, relational property that could be
instantiated by actual sequences of objects of the appropriate sort.
Structuralist accounts avoid one of the problems noted below (that
of
isomorphic models)
which besets all
versions of identificationism. They may also make the epistemology of
mathematics slightly less puzzling, since many structural or
pattern-like properties can be instantiated in the things we perceive
(we perceive such a property when we recognize a melody played in
different keys, for example). But they cannot deliver explanations of
the truth conditions and logical forms of arithmetical sentences that
are as straightforward as those provided by identificationist accounts
since they don't offer us any objects to serve as the referents of the
numerals.
Linsky and Zalta (1995) develop a novel account of mathematical truth
using Zalta's (1983) theory of abstract objects. (The account is
developed in much more detail in Zalta (2000) and (1999).) It is
relevant here because it is developed along side a formal account of
properties that rivals Bealer's in scope and detail. Abstract objects
are correlated with collections of properties (which needn't be either
maximal or consistent), situations are defined as a special sort of
abstract object, and mathematical theories are identified with
situations that encode only propositional properties. The account is
too detailed to present here, but we will discuss Zalta's basic
ideas
below
when we turn to the identity conditions of
properties.
The most obvious competitors to property-based accounts of mathematical
truth identify numbers with sets, and as long as we focus
solely on mathematics, sets may seem more appealing. After
all, sets do have clearer identity conditions than properties.
Moreover, the iterative conception of sets, a picture according to
which they form a natural hierarchy, fits nicely with our picture of
the structure of natural numbers, whereas an iterative conception of
properties is less natural. Finally, set theory provides a powerful
unifying framework in which all sorts of mathematical entities, like
functions and spaces, can be reconstructed (or at least represented) in
a common idiom and dealt with by a common stock of techniques (like
proofs by mathematical induction).
The most compelling defense of the use of properties in the
philosophy of mathematics urges that when we step back and consider the
big picture we see that a rich enough stock of properties can do all
the work of sets (and numbers — or that we can use them to define
sets or numbers) and that properties can do further things
that sets simply cannot. For example, it has been argued that
properties can be used to give accounts of the semantics of English or
explain the nature of natural laws. The appeal of sets, in short,
results from a metaphysical myopia, but once we adopt a larger view of
things we find that properties provide the best global, overall
explanation.
The gravest threats to identificationism are posed by what might be
called the Benacerraf problems. Authors who defend such
accounts are aware of these difficulties and have proposed various
responses to them, but the problems are serious and no solutions are
generally accepted.
As Benacerraf (1965) noted, if there is one way to identify the natural
numbers with sets, there are countless ways, e.g., Frege's, Zermelo's,
von Neumann's, etc. (For a brief discussion of this, see Section 2
("Set-theoretic Identificationism") of the supplementary document
Uses of Properties in the Philosophy of Mathematics.)
Some accounts are better for certain purposes than
others. But no account is best for all purposes, and if one was, no one
has ever explained how it would follow that it was the true
story about numbers.
There is a similar arbitrariness in any particular identification of
numbers with properties (as the fact that different property theorists
identify numbers with different properties shows). The point is most
obvious with those theories that treat properties as intensional
analogues of sets, since it is well-known that numbers can be
identified with sets in myriad ways. But it will be a problem for any
identificatory program, since there will be many isomorphic models of
number theory in the realm of properties (if it is commodious enough to
provide any models at all). And there is no reason for thinking that
any particular model gives The One True Story about what the numbers
actually are.
This difficulty also threatens less formal property-based accounts.
For example, there is some arbitrariness in Bigelow and Pargetter's
identifications, since we can find many different models of the theory
of rational numbers among the realm of ratio relations (e.g., we could
identify n/m with the relation n:m or with the
relation m:n), and there is no clear reason to suppose that
one identification is the right one.
The second problem, suggested by Benacerraf (1973) a few years later,
is that most versions of identificationism propose to identify numbers
with putative objects that lie outside the spatio-temporal, causal
order. The problem is that we are physical organisms living in a
spatio-temporal world who cannot interact causally (or in any other
discernible way) with abstract, causally inert things. Few people are
aware of having any special cognitive faculty that puts them in touch
with a timeless realm of abstract objects, neuroscientists have never
found any system in the brain that subserves such a capacity, such a
story is not suggested by what is known about the ways in which
children acquire numerical concepts, and nothing in physics remotely
suggests any way in which a physical system (the brain) can make any
sort of contact with causally inert, non-physical objects. None of this
proves that we don't have some sort of access to an abstract realm of
objects, but the claim that we do leaves the epistemology of
mathematics a mystery and, more importantly, there seems to be little
positive reason to suppose that it's true.
A few philosophers, e.g., Linsky & Zalta (1995) have taken the
problem of epistemic access seriously, and proposed solutions that do
not involve mysterious cognitive faculties. Philosophers remain divided
on this issue, but it is safe to say that if the problem of epistemic
access cannot be overcome, it in turn undermines identificationist
attempts to use properties to explain arithmetic truth. If we cannot
gain epistemic access to the realm of numbers, then there is no clear
way for us to establish connections between the items of our language
(e.g., ‘one’) and the numbers they denote. We can't, for
example, say that zero is the first number until we manage to attach
the word ‘number’ to the realm of numbers. It might seem
that we could avoid this difficulty by using purely structural
descriptions, ones employing only logical vocabulary, for the task. If
such descriptions were couched in a sufficiently powerful language they
could be used to characterize the natural numbers up to isomorphism.
Such a characterization is all we could ask of any formalization, but
it isn't enough to pick out the natural numbers themselves, since if
there is one model of a purely structural sentence incorporating such a
description, there will be many. For example, such a sentence will have
models in the domains of the positive real numbers, the negative real
numbers, many fragments of the iterative hierarchy of sets, and so
on.
Once again we face the fundamental ontological tradeoff: A richer
ontology offers to explain many things that might otherwise be
mysterious. But in the view of many philosophers, it engenders
epistemological mysteries of its own.
Identificationists sometimes speak of reducing numbers to
properties. Similarly, one might hope to reduce other things, e.g.,
possible worlds, to properties (e.g., Zalta, 1983, §4.2; Forrest,
1986). The aim is to show that they such things are nothing over and
above very complicated properties.
One of the most interesting reductionist programs attempts to reduce
individuals or particulars to collections of properties. Such programs
are often called bundle theories, since they identify ordinary
individuals with bundles of properties. Russell (1948, Pt. IV, ch. 8)
developed one account of this sort in which individuals were treated as
properties linked together by a relation he called
compresence. The evaluation of such accounts would require an
excursus into the ontology of individuals where issues like the problem
of individuation, the identity of indiscernibles, and identity through
time loom large. Such matters lie outside the scope of our present
discussion, though it is worth noting that they involve a purer version
of ontology than theories of properties; they have relatively few
implications outside of ontology itself.
What do property-based versions of identificationism tell us about the
nature of properties? We can read off minimum requirements
from the fact that in this domain sets can do most of the work that
properties are invoked to do.
Existence Conditions: We require an
infinite realm containing at least aleph-null (the smallest infinite
cardinal number) many properties. Depending on our aspirations, we may
need many more. For example, if we want to work with huge transfinite
cardinal numbers, we will need a very large infinity of properties.
Identity Conditions: Formalized mathematics is one
of the few domains where extensionality reigns, and the fact that sets
can be used as surrogates of the natural numbers tells us that entities
with very coarse-grained identity conditions can do at least most of
the work of numbers.
Structure: The realm of properties has to include
enough relations among properties to give it the structure of an
omega-sequence. And if we want to identify others sorts of numbers,
e.g., the real, or complex, or transfinite ordinal numbers, with
properties, we will require many additional properties as well as
further relations to structure them in the right sorts of ways.
Modal Status: If the truths or arithmetic are
necessarily true, then we need a realm of necessarily existing
properties that necessarily stand in the (mathematically relevant)
relations that they do.
Epistemic Status: If the truths of arithmetic can
be known a priori, then the arithmetic features of those
properties that play the role of numbers must be knowable a
priori.
Language and logic have long been an important source of data for
ontologists. Many philosophers have contented themselves with fairly
informal appeals to various features of language to support their claim
that properties exist, but in the last two decades some philosophers
(along with a few linguists and even computer scientists) have employed
properties as parts of detailed accounts of the semantics (meaning) of
large fragments of natural languages like English or Choctaw, and some
of these accounts contain the most detailed formal theories of
properties ever devised. Some property theorists are motivated almost
exclusively by a desire to give a semantic account of natural language
(e.g., Chierchia and Turner, 1988), others hold that this is but one of
several motivations for developing an account of properties (e.g.,
Bealer, 1982; Zalta, 1993), but it should be noted that still others
(e.g., Jubien, 1989; Armstrong, 1997; cf. Mellor, 1986, pp. 180ff)
doubt that properties have any serious role to play in semantics at
all.
Semantic accounts often go hand in hand with theories of logical form.
Logical form is a technical notion motivated by the
observation that sentences with a similar surface structure may exhibit
quite different logical behavior. For example, ‘John is tall and
Tom is tall’ entails ‘Tom is tall’, but ‘You
show me someone who dislikes John and I'll show you a real
misanthrope’ does not entail ‘I'll show you a real
misanthrope’. Furthermore, sentences that appear different on the
surface may exhibit similar logical behavior. For example, ‘You
show me someone who dislikes John and I'll show you a real
misanthrope’ and ‘If you show me someone who dislikes John,
then I'll show you a real misanthrope’ evince similar logical
behavior.
Such facts led various philosophers to introduce a theoretical
notion of logical form and to use it to provide theoretical
redescriptions of sentences in terms of their logical form in a way
that allows us to explain their logical features (e.g., why they are
consistent with some sentences but not with others or why they entail
the sentences they do). Although philosophers differ in how systematic
they are in developing such accounts, most arguments to the effect that
properties are needed to explain linguistic phenomena are linked to
some conception of logical form.
We will begin with four linguistic phenomena that might be explained
by a relatively informal and somewhat piecemeal account of
properties.
- General terms like ‘blue’ and ‘honest’ can
apply to a variety of things, they apply to the things that they do
partly because of their meanings, and in some cases where two
predicates in fact apply to exactly the same things, they could have
applied to different things.
- Abstract singular terms like ‘courage’ can occupy
subject position in true sentences (‘Courage is a virtue’),
they seem to be referring singular terms, and many of sentences of this
sort (e.g., ‘Courage is Tom's favorite virtue’) cannot be
paraphrased in a way that eliminates the abstract singular term.
- We can use pronouns (which certainly seem to be referring
expressions) that are anaphorically linked back to predicates
(‘Clinton is undisciplined, and that is a bad quality in
a president’) or to terms in subject position like gerunds
(‘Being undisciplined is deplorable, and it also
endangers others’).
- Many sentences of English appear to quantify over the semantics
values of predicates (‘Clinton is tenacious, so there is at least
one virtue that he has’) or abstract singular terms
(‘Lethargy is a symptom of mononucleosis, so there is at least
one symptom of that malady’). And although some of these
sentences can perhaps be paraphrased or reconstrued in ways that dispel
the appearance of quantification, many have resisted years of such
attempts. For example, ‘There are some properties that will never
be named’ cannot be interpreted as an ontologically harmless
substitutional quantification. We can also count the things predicates
or abstract singular terms stand for (e.g., ‘There are exactly
two symptoms that mononucleosis and Barr-Epstein syndrome have in
common’) and abstract singular terms can flank the identity
predicate (e.g., ‘I believe in the unity of virtue: courage and
temperance are the same thing’).
As long as we lack a precise mathematical characterization of English,
it isn't possible to prove that certain idioms cannot be
paraphrased away. But the use of abstract singular terms is so common
and the failures of attempts to paraphrase them away are so clearcut
that there is no reason to think that they could be eliminated from
English without eviscerating it.
A relatively unsophisticated account of properties can be mobilized
to explain the four phenomena listed above in a way that allows us to
use a relatively straightforward referential semantics with objectual
quantifiers. Such accounts explain the meanings of general terms (item
1) like ‘honest’ by claiming that they denote (or express)
properties (like honesty), that a sentence like ‘Tom is
honest’ has the logical form of a simple, subject-predicate
sentence, and that it is true just in case the individual denoted by
‘Tom’ is in the extension of the property denoted (or
expressed) by the predicate ‘honest’, which requires that
there be a property expressed by this predicate (a slightly more formal
account is given
below;
see Hochberg,
1968, for a good discussion of related issues).
In a similar spirit, some philosophers argue that abstract singular
terms like ‘honesty’ (item 2) denote the property
that the associated predicate (‘honest’) denotes or
expresses, that sentences like ‘Honesty is a virtue’ have
the simple logical form of a subject-predicate sentence, and that the
sentence is true exactly when the word ‘honesty’ denotes a
property that is in the extension of the property denoted by the verb
phrase ‘is a virtue’.
Once we take these steps, it is also straightforward to explain the
remaining items on our list. For example the validity of the argument:
‘Clinton is self-indulgent; therefore, there is at least one vice
that Clinton has’ can be explained as follows: The logical form
of the premise is that a simple subject-predicate sentence and the
logical from of the conclusion is that of an existential quantification
with a standard objectual quantifier. If the first sentence is true,
then ‘self-indulgent’ expresses a property, and this
property satisfies the open sentence ‘Clinton is X’. Hence,
just as in standard first-order logic, the existential quantification
is true. Similar maneuvers allows us to explain the remaining items on
this list: if properties are genuine things, then we can count them and
we can use different expressions to stand for the same property.
These explanations rely on little more than the following three
claims. First, there is a rich enough stock of properties to provide a
semantic value (meaning) for every predicate and abstract singular term
of English (or better, for all of those that could have such semantic
values without leading to paradox). Second, sentences like
‘Courage is a virtue’ and ‘John is courageous’
are simple subject-predicate sentences. Third, such sentences are true
just in case the thing denoted by the subject is in the extension of
the property denoted (or expressed) by the predicate.
These simple assumptions account for the phenomena on our list in a
much better way than their more prominent rivals can. Some
philosophers, for example, hold that predicates have a multiple
denotation (multiply denoting all of the things to which they apply).
Others hold that the semantic values of predicates are sets (the sets
of things to which they apply). But these accounts cannot explain the
fact that many pairs of predicates that in fact have the same extension
(and hence the same multiple denotation‘) could have
applied to different groups of things and that their meanings are
precisely what allow them to do so. Even more seriously, these two
rivals have no plausible account at all of the last three items on the
list.
If the goal is simply to argue that there are properties because there
is no other way to explain several obvious linguistic and logical
phenomena (which is all many philosophers have aspired to show), then
the simple accounts sketched above make a plausible (though certainly
not unassailable) start. Some philosophers have set their sights
higher, however, wanting to provide a rigorous and systematic account
of the semantics of a large fragment of English. They try to work the
above ideas out in a more detailed way and to extend them to deal with
more complex phenomena, including the following:
- Various English constructions are quite naturally interpreted as
complex predicates: ‘Tom is a boring but honest brother of
Sam’ is straightforwardly construed as a containing a compound
predicate, ‘is a boring but honest brother of Sam’ that is
predicated of the noun ‘Tom’ (and that could be predicated
of other nouns too, e.g., ‘Wilbur’). Other constructions
are very naturally interpreted as complex singular terms (as in
‘Being a boring but honest brother of Sam is no bed of
roses’). Furthermore, these complex expressions are related to
simpler expressions in systematic ways. For example, ‘Tom is a
boring but not dishonest brother of Sam’ should entail ‘Tom
is not dishonest’.
- English is full of intensional idioms like
‘necessarily’, ‘believes’ and
‘imagines’ that cannot be handled by any extensional
semantics.
The simple, informal claim that there are properties cannot explain
such phenomena in a systematic way, especially when they are combined
(as in ‘Tom believes that it is necessarily the case that being a
seventh son is more like being a sixth son than like being a fifth
son’).
In recent years a number of philosophers (e.g., Bealer, 1982, 1994;
Zalta, 1983, 1988; Chierchia & Turner, 1988; Menzel, 1993) have
developed intricate accounts that include formal logics whose semantics
provide systematic ways of forming "compound" properties (e.g.,
loving Darla) to serve as semantic values of complex
predicates (‘loves Darla’) or complex singular terms
(‘loving Darla). The details of such accounts are too complex to
pursue here (although a generic account of some of the central ideas
will be sketched in
§8).
It should be noted,
however, that most philosophers who aspire to a semantic account of
large intensional fragments of English introduce
propositions,
which they treat as zero-place
properties.
The proper treatment of intentional idioms like ‘believes
that’ also require properties that are very finely individuated,
probably as finely individuated as the linguistic expressions that
denote or express them. For example Tom's grasp of logic may be so
tenuous that he believes of Ortcutt that he is a spy and an auditor for
the IRS but doubts that he is an auditor for the IRS and a spy. This is
sometimes taken to suggest that being a spy and an auditor for the
IRS is distinct from the (necessarily coextensive) property
being an auditor for the IRS and a spy. To be sure, few people
are guilty of such blatant lapses, but we can certainly make mistakes
when necessarily coextensive properties are described in more
complicated ways (such errors are routine in mathematics and
logic).
On the plausible (though not inevitable) assumption that the
structure of many of our thoughts is similar to the structure of the
sentences we use to describe the contents of those thoughts (‘Sam
thinks Tom is boring but not dishonest’), we might also hope to
use properties in an account of mental content that would in many ways
parallel an account of the semantics of the more intensional fragments
of English.
Accounts that treat the semantic values of predicates as sets can
handle a certain amount of English if we are willing to twist
("regiment") it into a rather complex, even tortured logical form. But
little is gained by this, since such approaches cannot accommodate such
simple intensional phenomena as the fact that two predicates might just
happen to apply to exactly the same things even though they could have
applied to different things. And extensional accounts do even worse
with complex nominalizations or more complicated intensional idioms
like ‘believes that’. Sets (of ordinary things) are simply
too coarse-grained to make the fine distinctions semantic theories
require.
The only serious alternative to the use of properties in formal
semantics treats the semantic values of noun phrases and verb phrases
as intensions. Intensions are functions that assign a set to
the expression at each possible world (or related set-theoretic devices
that encode the same information). On such accounts, for example, the
semantic value of ‘red’ is the function that maps each
possible world to the set of things in that world that are red.
Montague (1974) and linguists and philosophers inspired by his work
have devised systems inspired by this idea that have great elegance and
power. Nevertheless, properties are more natural and better suited to
handle many linguistic constructions than intensions are.
Properties are more natural, because we learn the meanings of many
predicates by ostension, and we group objects together when they share
properties that seem salient or important. I recognize the sound of an
oboe or the taste of rhubarb; these are very direct and simple
experiences that seem completely unrelated to functions from huge
infinite sets of possible worlds to objects therein. If we learn to
recognize certain properties and categorize objects in terms of such
properties, this is relatively easy to understand. But if the semantic
values of predicates are intensions, meanings are now incredibly
complicated set-theoretic objects that require a huge ontology of
possible worlds and, often, merely possible individuals.
Properties are more useful in semantics than intensions because
intensions are still too coarse-grained to explain many semantic
phenomena involving intensional idioms. For example, semantic accounts
that employ intensions would most naturally treat ‘lasted a
fortnight’ and ‘lasted two weeks’ as having the same
meaning (since they have the same intension), which makes it difficult
for such accounts to explain how ‘Tom believes the battle lasted
two weeks, but does not believe that it lasted a fortnight’ could
be true. Various stratagems are available to deal with problematic
cases like this, but they are much less natural and involve a much more
dubious ontology (all those sets and possible worlds) than accounts
that employ properties. Furthermore, intensions are unlikely to be able
to perform tasks in areas outside semantics (like naturalistic
ontology) that properties may be able to do. It is natural, for
example, to suppose that things have the capacities that they do (e.g.,
the capacity to exert a force on a distant object) because of the
properties they possess (e.g., gravitational mass). But it seems most
unlikely that huge, set-theoretic intensions would be able to explain
things like this.
Some philosophers have construed intensions as providing a
reduction of properties to intensions (properties are nothing
over and above functions from the class of possible worlds to classes
of objects). We have seen that this account has little to recommend it,
and it is much better to view properties (including relations, and
perhaps propositions) as primitive entities. Other philosophers, less
concerned with formal matters, have sometimes envisioned a reduction of
properties to sets of tropes; a discussion of some of the issues this
involves will be found in the entry on
tropes.
Every large-scale theory of the semantics of English generates
anomalies of one sort of another. Furthermore, some accounts require
very large ontologies and very finely-drawn distinctions. For example,
on really fine-grained accounts of the identity conditions of
properties, the relations loving and the converse of its
converse are distinct relations. Similarly, the properties being
red and square and being square and red are distinct. We
might wonder whether such distinctions exist and (if they do) what
enables us to match the right linguistic expressions with the right
relation? How do we match ‘red and square’ and
‘square and red’ with the correct members of the relevant
pair of properties (we will return to this matter below)?
If the properties needed for semantics are completely isolated from
the natural world, the epistemological problems noted in the previous
subsection (on the philosophy of mathematics) resurface. We might hope
to avoid this by holding that all properties are either instantiated or
that they can be constructed by a series of applications of logical
operations (like conjunction and negation) from properties that are
instantiated. But it is far from clear that we can "construct"
properties to serve as the semantic values for all English predicative
expressions in this way. But could we define properties to serve as
semantic values for all the predicates that lack instances? Expressions
like ‘witch’ have a good bit of open texture, and it is at
best an open question whether we can define them in terms of properties
that are actually instantiated.
Current property-based semantic theories do not accommodate
vagueness. This is a serious shortcoming, because vague predicates
(like ‘bald’) and vague nominalizations (like
‘baldness’) are the rule, rather than the exception. When
property-based semantic theories are modified to accommodate them,
their proponents will have to decide whether vagueness is an objective
feature in the world itself (so that some properties themselves are
vague, in the sense of having vague or fuzzy extensions), or whether
all vagueness resides in language (with properties having precise
extensions and vagueness arising because it is sometimes somewhat
indeterminate which sharp-edged property a given predicate or
nominalization denotes).
Recent empirical work on concepts reinforces the point that many
concepts (and, with them, predicates) have a graded membership and goes
on to stress the importance of phenomena like typicality. Some
creatures are more typical examples of birds than others, and there is
some evidence that we determine whether something is a bird by
assessing how similar (according to some psychological standard of
similarity) it is to typical birds. This and various other phenomena
have inspired a range of accounts of the structures of concepts,
beginning with Rosch's (1978) account of prototypes and now including
other accounts like exemplar theory (where we store exemplars of a
concept in memory and determine what other things fall under that
concept by assessing how similar they are to those exemplars).
Different accounts may well apply to different sorts of concepts
(and perhaps, derivatively, to the predicates associated with them).
For example, most mathematical concepts do have sharp boundaries,
whereas many everyday concepts do not. On many recent psychological
accounts, concepts involve features and similarity relations. Since
features (e.g., having feathers, having a beak) are properties, there
is no reason why current property theories could not be emended and
extended to make contact with such accounts, and it seems likely that
this will be a fruitful line of inquiry in the future (see Margolis
& Laurence, 1999, for a useful selection of papers on
concepts).
What do semantic theories based on properties tell us about the
nature of properties? The lessons here are less
straightforward than in the philosophy of mathematics, partly because a
detailed semantic theory must include a number of elements in addition
to a theory of properties. For example, it must include a theory about
the underlying logic in which the theory of properties is formulated, a
theory about the logical forms of various English constructions (e.g.,
belief-sentences, gerundive phrases, parenthetical clauses), and
perhaps claims that certain apparent entailment relations among English
sentences don't really hold (e.g., because they are implicatures rather
than logical entailments).
In short, we test a total package of such assumptions when
we see how well a semantic theory accommodates our intuitions about
what entails what or which groups of sentences are consistent.
Moreover, somewhat different theories of properties may provide equally
good accounts if we make compensatory adjustments in their underlying
logics, in their accounts of the logical form of various constructions,
or in our views about implicatures. Still, we have seen enough to draw
some tentative lessons about properties from their use in
semantics.
Existence Conditions: If we want to
account for the meanings of all predicates or all abstract singular
terms (save for those which would lead to
paradox),
we need a very large stock of
properties to serve as their semantic values (and since languages are
extensible, we need properties to serve as the semantic values for any
words that might ever be added).
Identity Conditions: Even if we only aim to use
properties as semantics values for run of the mill predicates,
properties must be more finely individuated than sets. And if we hope
to use properties as part of a systematic semantic account of belief
attributions and other intensional idioms, they will have to be even
more finely individuated than intensions. They will have to be (at
least) nearly as finely individuated as the linguistic expressions that
denote (or express) them.
Structure: If we want to account for the behavior
of complex predicates or complex singular terms in a systematic way,
properties need to have something akin to a logical structure (we will
explore the relevant notion of structure in
§8.2).
Modal Status: The use of properties in many parts
of semantics does not obviously require that properties exist
necessarily. But when we turn to portions of English that explicitly
involve the alethic modalities and related notions, i.e., when we turn
to sentences (like ‘Red is necessarily a color’, ‘7
is necessarily prime’), the most natural accounts will involve
properties that exist necessarily.
Epistemic Status: If properties are used to furnish
semantic values for a multitude of expressions of a natural language
like English or Choctaw, then we will need a lavish realm of properties
that includes properties that are not instantiated. If such properties
raise epistemological problems, then there will be difficulties
explaining how our linguistic behavior, here in the natural world,
involves properties we couldn't know much about. Furthermore, the more
facts about language we can know a priori, the more likely it
is that we will need some sort of a priori access to
properties.
In recent years properties have played a central role in philosophical
accounts of scientific realism, measurement, causation, dispositions,
and natural laws. This is a less unified set of concerns than those
encountered in the previous two subsections, but it is still a clearly
recognizable area, and I will call it naturalistic ontology.
The use of properties in naturalistic ontology is often less formal and
more varied than the work in the areas we have examined. I will
indicate the flavor of this work by describing several noteworthy
treatments of topics in the area.
Even quite modest and selective versions of scientific realism are most
easily developed with the aid of properties. This is so because they
offer a way to account for the following phenomena.
Claims that appear to quantify over properties are common in science.
- If one organism is fitter than a conspecific, then there is at
least one property the first organism has that gives it a greater
propensity to reproduce than the second.
- There are many inherited characteristics, but there are no acquired
characteristics that are inherited.
- Properties and relations measured on an interval scale are
invariant under positive linear transformations, but this isn't true of
all properties and relations measured on ordinal scales.
- In a Newtonian world all fundamental ("meaningful") properties are
invariant under Galilean transformations, whereas the fundamental
properties in a special-relativistic world are those that are invariant
under Lorentz transformation.
No one has any idea how to paraphrase most of these claims in a
non-quantificational idiom, and they certainly seem to assert (or deny)
the existence of various sorts of properties. The claim that this is in
fact precisely what they do explains how they can be meaningful and, in
many cases, true.
Many important properties like being a simple harmonic
oscillator, being a gene, being an edge
detector, or being a belief are often thought to be
functional properties. To be a gene, for example, is to play a certain
causal role in the transmission of hereditary information, and it is in
principle possible for quite disparate physical mechanisms to play this
role. To say that something exemplifies a functional property is,
roughly, to say that there are certain properties that it
exemplifies and that together they allow it to play a certain causal
role. For example, DNA molecules have certain properties that allow
them to transmit genetic information in pretty much in the way
described by Mendel's laws. Here again, we have quantifications over
properties that seem unavoidable.
Much explanation in science is causal explanation, and casual
explanations often proceed by citing properties of the things involved
in causal interactions. For example, electrons repel one another in the
way that they do because they have the same charge (we will
return to this below).
A few decades ago claims that one sort of thing was reducible
to a second were common; e.g., one often heard that the temperature of
a gas is reducible to its mean molecular kinetic energy. Nowadays we
are more likely to hear that one sort of thing
supervenes
on another: e.g., all
biological (or all psychological) features of an organism supervene on
its physical properties. Such claims make the best sense if we take
them to involve properties. For example the claim that the
psychological realm supervenes on the physical realm is plausibly
construed as the claim that, necessarily, everything that has any
psychological properties also has physical properties and any two
things that have exactly the same physical properties will have exactly
the same psychological properties. Disputes remain about the best way
to spell out the fine print, but almost all of the candidates advert to
properties.
Some philosophers of science, most notably Feyerabend and Kuhn, argue
that theoretical terms draw their meaning from the theories within
which they occur. Hence, they conclude, a change in theory causes a
shift in the meanings of all of its constituent terms, and so different
theories simply talk about different things. And since Newton's talk of
‘mass’ and Einstein's talk of ‘mass’ are about
different things, their theories cannot be rationally compared; the
theories are "incommensurable". The common realist rejoinder is that
the reference of terms can remain the same even when the surrounding
theory shifts (at least as long as it doesn't shift too much). Now it
is certainly true that some realists have placed a greater explanatory
burden on reference than it can bear. But for this response to work,
even in cases of small shifts in theory, terms like ‘mass’
or ‘rest mass’ or ‘mass of 3.4kg’ must refer to
something, and the most plausible candidate for this is a property.
Various features of measurement are most easily explained by invoking
properties.
Simpler anti-realist theories of measurement (like operationalism)
cannot explain how we can use different methods to measure the same
thing, e.g., how we can use such different methods to measure lengths
and distances in cosmology, geology, histology, and atomic physics. By
contrast, the view that measurements aim to discover objective
properties can explain this.
In many sciences it is expected that estimates of the magnitude of
measurement error will be reported along with measurement results.
Indeed, in fields like econometrics and psychometrics, extremely
detailed theories of error are always near center stage. But such talk
makes little sense unless there is a fact about what a correct
measurement would be. Since an object can have one magnitude (e.g., a
rest mass of 3kg) at one time and a different magnitude (e.g., a rest
mass of 4kg) at another time, the object alone cannot explain this. But
it is quite naturally explained by assuming that the object
instantiates two different mass properties (namely a rest mass of 3 kg,
and a rest mass of 4 kg) at the two different times. It also explains
why later techniques for measuring things can be more accurate than
earlier methods (e.g., why Atwood's machine allowed him to measure the
value of the gravitational constant much more accurately than his
predecessors could).
Nowadays measurement units are often specified directly in terms of
properties. At one time the meter was specified as the length of the
standard meter bar in Paris, But we now specify the meter in terms of
something that can in principle be instantiated anywhere in the world,
e.g., as the length equal to a certain number of wavelengths
(in a vacuum) of a particular color of light emitted by krypton 86
atoms.
These facts have led to several adaptations of the representational
theory of measurement developed by Suppes and his coworkers to a
framework involving properties (Mundy, 1987; Swoyer, 1987). Among other
things, these accounts offer characterizations of the algebraic
structure of many of the properties involved in measurement.
Some philosophers have employed properties in reductive accounts of
causation (cf. Tooley; 1987; Fales, 1990). It would take us too far
afield to explore this work here, but it is worth noting that it is
never a single, undifferentiated amorphous blob of an object (or blob
of an event) that makes things happen. It is an object (or event)
with properties. Furthermore, how it affects things
depends on what these properties are. The liquid in the glass causes
the litmus paper to turn blue because the liquid is an alkaline (and
not because the liquid also happens to be blue). The Earth exerts a
gravitational force of the moon because of their respective
gravitational masses. And because explanations often cite causes, it is
not surprising that explanations frequently cite properties: the
liquid's being an alkaline explains why it turned the litmus paper blue
(this doesn't preclude deeper explanations involving the molecular
mechanisms that underlie this process, but they too will typically
involve properties (like valence and charge)).
Some causal powers are deterministic: any object with a
gravitational mass will exert a certain amount of force on an object
with a certain gravitational mass at a certain distance from it. Others
are indeterministic: photons can be prepared in a state that
will give them a 50/50 chance of making it through a polarizer set at a
certain angle. In some cases the only informative things we
can say about a property are what tendencies or powers or capacities it
confers on its instances. For example, the things we know about
determinate charges have to do with the active and passive powers they
confer on particles that instantiate them, their effects on the
electromagnetic fields surrounding them, and the like. Thus, two
negatively charged particles at a given distance will exert a force
with a specific magnitude and direction on each other that depends on
their respective charges (monadic properties) and the distance between
them (a two-place relation) in accordance with Coulomb's law. Similar
points hold for many other properties in science, including mass,
momentum, force, electrical resistance, tensile strength, torque, and
spin.
Such facts have led some philosophers to claim that properties are
essentially dispositional, or even that properties just are
dispositions. This led to a debate over whether all properties are
dispositional (like charge and spin are) or whether some were
non-dispositional (perhaps like squareness). The discussion here was
considerably clarified by Shoemaker's (1984, p. 210ff) claim that it is
linguistic items, rather than properties, that are
dispositional or not. Some predicates, e.g., ‘fragile’,
‘flexible’, and ‘irascible’ are dispositional,
whereas predicates, e.g., ‘square’ and ‘table’
arguably are not. But all properties confer causal powers on their
instances; a square peg does not have the capacity to fit into a round
hole (below a certain size).
Philosophers who focus on the causal or nomological capacities that
properties confer on their instances often urge that properties are
identical just in case they confer the same
capacities on their instances (e.g., Achinstein, 1974; Armstrong, 1978,
Ch. 16; Shoemaker 1984, Ch. 10-11). This general idea leaves us with
questions about the relationship between properties and the capacities
they bestow, but using fairly intuitive (though not incontrovertible)
counting principles for properties and capacities, we can say the
following:
Different Properties, Same Power:
Different properties can bestow the same powers on their instances. For
example, charge and gravitational mass both bestow a power to exert a
force on nearby objects (that have the right sorts of properties).
Same Property, Different Powers: A single property
can bestow different powers on its instances. For example, a
determinate
charge like the unit negative
charge that characterizes electrons confers an ability to exert an
attractive force on positively-charged particles and it confers an
ability to exert a repulsive force on negatively-charged particles.
Although the connection between properties and powers is important, it
isn't fully understood. Is a capacity an additional sort of property
over and above the property that confers it? This sounds unduly
complicated, but if this is not the case we need an account of the
relationship.
Properties have played a central role in several recent accounts of
natural laws. I will focus on two accounts that put properties at
center stage; hybrids are possible, but the examples discussed here
typify much recent work.
Laws of nature (e.g., the ideal gas laws, Newton's laws,
Shrödinger's equation, Einstein's field equations for general
relativity, conservation laws) have several important features, and the
task of a philosophical account of laws is to explain how this is so.
Different philosophers view different (and sometimes incompatible)
features as central to laws, but those who favor what I will call
N-relation theories agree that laws have (at least most of)
the following five features. I will focus primarily on deterministic
laws, not because they are more important than probabilistic laws, but
because if an account cannot get deterministic laws right, it will have
little chance with probabilistic laws.
- Laws are objective. We don't invent laws, we discover them.
- Laws have modal force. This shows up when we describe laws (or
their implications) using words like ‘must’,
‘require’, ‘preclude’, and
‘impossible’.
- Laws, unlike accidental generalizations, are confirmed by their
instances and underwrite predictions.
- The line between laws and non-laws is sharp; nomologicality does
not come in degrees (this is implicit in the work of many
N-relation theorists; Armstrong, 1983, p. 71 notes that his
account depends on it).
- Laws have genuine explanatory power. They play a central role in
scientific explanation that accidental generalizations cannot.
N-relation theories have been defended by Armstrong (e.g.,
1978, 1983), Dretske (1977), Tooley (1977) and others. Their accounts
differ in detail, but they share the core idea that laws of nature are
relations among properties. A law is a second-order relation of
nomic necessitation (N, for short) holding among two or more
first-order properties. Hence the logical form of a statement
of a simple law is not ‘All Fs are Gs’; in the case of a
law involving two first-order properties, it is a second-order atomic
sentence of the form ‘N(F,G)’.
In the more exact sciences these first-order properties (our
Fs and Gs) will typically be
determinate
magnitudes like a kinetic energy
of 1.6 × 10-2 joule or a force of 1 newton or an
electrical resistance of 12.3 ohms (rather than mass or force or
resistance simpliciter). Hence the laws specified by an equation (like
Newton's second law) are really infinite families of specific laws
where each specific, determinate mass m (a scalar, and so a
monadic property) and total impressed force f (a vector, and
so a relational property) stand in the N-relation to the
appropriate relation (vector) of acceleration a (=
f/m).
The dominant accounts of laws during much of this century were
regularity theories, and N-relation theories were
originally devised to avoid perceived shortcomings of these earlier
accounts. There are many versions of the regularity theory, but they
share the core idea that laws are simply contingent regularities (or
the sentences expressing them). On such views there is no
metaphysical difference between genuine laws and true
accidental generalizations (at least accidental generalizations
involving
purely qualitative
predicates or
properties) like ‘all cubes of pure gold weigh less than ten
tons’ (which I'll assume is true). According to regularity
theorists, the only difference between laws and accidental regularities
is that laws have some special epistemic or pragmatic or logical
trappings (e.g., they contain projectible predicates like ‘rest
mass’ rather than ‘grue’ or they form part of a
powerful deductive theory). The most prominent version of the
regularity theory nowadays is the Ramsey-Lewis account, according to
which laws are those universal generalizations that would be part of
the overall systematization of our theories about the world that best
combines simplicity and strength.
One of the chief attractions of regularity theories is that they
have a relatively low epistemological cost. We observe instances of
many regularities here in the actual world, and the additional features
used to upgrade regularities to laws are not epistemically problematic
in any deep way. Indeed, although there are various detailed problems
with regularity theories, the major issues between N-relation
theorists and regularity theorists involve the
fundamental ontological tradeoff.
According to
N-relation theorists, regularity theories only achieve their
epistemic security by being so weak that they cannot explain the
fundamental features of laws. Regularity theorists counter that the
N-relation is a mysterious bit of metaphysics, and that there
is no way we could ever gain epistemic access to it.
N-relation theorists respond that we should believe in it
because it provides the best explanation of the five items on the above
list. Is this response plausible? To evaluate it we need to look
briefly at how those explanations are supposed to work.
According to N-relation theories, laws are objective because
the N-relation relates those properties it does quite
independently of our language and thought (in the case of properties
that don't specifically involve our language or thought). By contrast,
the epistemic and pragmatic features used by regularity theorists to
demarcate laws from accidental generalizations are too anthropocentric
to account for the objectivity of laws.
Many laws seem to necessitate some things and to preclude others.
Pauli's exclusion principle requires that two fermions occupy
different quantum states. The special theory of relativity doesn't
allow a signal to be propagated at a velocity exceeding that of
light. The laws of thermodynamics show the impossibility of
perpetual motion machines. Conservation laws assure us that such
quantities as angular momentum, mass-energy, and charge cannot
be created or destroyed. The modal force of laws is also said to
manifest itself in the way laws support counterfactuals; had there been
a tenth planet, it too would have obeyed Kepler's Laws. But,
N-relation theorists insist, since regularity theorists
forswear everything modal, they can never account for the modal aspects
of laws.
N-relation theorists often argue that their accounts can, and
that regularity theories cannot, explain how laws are confirmed by
their instances. If laws were mere regularities, then the fact
that observed Fs have been Gs would give us no reason
to conclude that those Fs we haven't encountered will also be
G. If the Fs we have observed are to be
relevant to our belief that unobserved Fs are
Gs, then there needs to be something about an
object's being F that requires (or, in the case of
probabilistic laws, makes it probable) that it will also be G.
And if the properties F and G stand in a nomic
relation, then the properties themselves (and not merely their
instances) are related in a law-like way. Hence, if N-relation
accounts are right, there will be something about an object's
being an F that will make it be a G, and the examined
cases will be related to the unexamined cases in the relevant way.
Properties either stand in the N-relation or they do not. When
they do, we have a law; when they do not, we don't.
The accidental regularity that all cubes of gold weigh less than ten
tons doesn't explain why any particular cube of gold weighs less than
ten tons. But, N-relation theorists often argue, if one
property nomically necessitates a second, that does explain why
anything having the first also has the second.
If N-relation accounts are on the right track, there is a
reasonably rich realm of properties that is structured by one or more
nomic relations. But before drawing this conclusion we should note that
N-relation theories face difficulties of their own. Indeed, it
is unclear whether N-relation theories can successfully
explain all of the things they were introduced to explain, but we will
focus on two more general difficulties here. (A fuller discussion of
the problems for N-relation theories can be found in the
supplementary document
Difficulties for N-relation Accounts of Natural Laws.)
First, it is not clear how to extend
N-relation accounts to deal with several important kinds of
laws, most prominently conservation laws and symmetry principles.
Second, even in the case of laws that can be coaxed (or crammed) into
the N-relation scheme, the account involves a highly idealized
notion whose connection to the things that go by the name
‘law’ in labs and research centers is rather remote.
At this point some philosophers propose a distinction between the
current laws of science and the true laws of nature.
The former are approximate, idealized and provisional, whereas the
later are precise, definite and unchanging. Furthermore, they continue,
while it is perfectly respectable for philosophers to discuss the
current laws of science, philosophy should also provide an account of
the true laws of nature. But although some philosophers propose lists
(like the one above) of features that are supposed to characterize the
true laws of nature, it is not clear that there are any laws of this
sort. At all events, current science doesn't force this conclusion on
us, and the claim that there are such laws involves a bit of
metaphysical speculation.
If we begin with actual scientific laws, we are likely to come up with
quite different features from those on the
list above.
- Laws almost always involve approximation and idealization Sometimes
the idealization is so great that a law is quite inaccurate over parts
of the range of phenomena it is supposed to cover (as is the law for
the simple pendulum or the general gas laws). Most laws only hold
ceteris paribus, "other things being equal," but other things
rarely are.
- When we apply a law to a situation, we often use a highly
simplified version of the law that everyone acknowledges is false.
- Laws are not in any straightforward way confirmed by their
instances. Actual data and phenomena that provide evidence for a law
rarely fit it exactly (even when we discount for measurement
error).
- We often explain things by citing the causal mechanisms and
processes they involve, rather than by subsuming them under general
laws. For example, we do not explain why all crows are black by saying
(in some more idiomatic way) that the N-relation holds between
the properties being a crow and being black. We
explain it by finding causal (in this case genetic) mechanisms that
link the two properties. In other cases we appeal to a deeper theory,
e.g., we explain why Kepler's laws hold (to the extent that they do) by
deriving (approximations of) them from Newton's laws.
- The distinction between laws and accidental generalizations is a
matter of degree. We often talk as though some laws (e.g., various
conservation laws) are very fundamental and robust, while other laws
(e.g., Hooke's Law, Boyle's Law, Gresham's Law) are less so.
A philosopher who sees 1-5 as central features of laws will be drawn to
an account that is very different from that proposed by
N-relation theorists. Far from involving universal (or even
precise probabilistic) nomological relations, actual laws are
idealized, approximate, and limited in scope (often applying only to
highly artificial systems created in laboratories or even just to
simplified models of real systems).
When N-relation theories first appeared on the scene much
of their appeal was that they promised a better account of the
objectivity and (perhaps) the modal status of laws than regularity
theories could provide. But it is now possible to discern the
beginnings of an account that explains these things (to the limited
degree that they hold) and that also explains how actual laws work. I
will quickly sketch a generic version of such an account here (several
versions are in the air, but most of them owe a large debt to
Cartwright, 1983; 1989).
We have already noted that (at least many) properties confer causal
capacities and tendencies on their instances. For example, electrically
charged particles have a capacity to exert forces on other particles
and to affect an electromagnetic field around them in virtue
of the property of having a specific, determinate charge. This is
a perfectly objective fact, and it has a certain modal force (if the
particles had moved away from each other, the forces would have fallen
off with the square of the distance between them). This suggests the
view that laws result from the operations of capacities (including
probabilistic capacities). Laws tell us what happens when we shield off
(or hold constant) the influence of other capacities and allow a single
capacity (or just a few capacities) to work without interference. In a
few cases we can shield the operation of a single capacity from outside
influences in a way that allows us to make fairly precise and accurate
predictions, and cases like this may approximate the
N-relation theorist's conception of a law. But most laws, and
most applications of laws, aren't like this. The detailed behavior of
most things, including many relatively simple physical systems, results
from the joint operation of many capacities or tendencies, and often it
cannot be predicted, or even explained, on the basis of such laws.
Accounts like Cartwright's take science at face value and they leave
room for laws in fields other than basic physics. But for our purposes
the most important thing about them is that they, like
N-relation theories, place properties at center stage.
The work discussed in this subsection suggests that properties include
determinate physical magnitudes like being a mass of 3.7 kg
and being an electrical resistance of 7 ohms. Furthermore,
such properties typically form families of ordered determinates (e.g.,
the family of determinate masses) that have a definite algebraic
structure (Mundy, 1987; Swoyer, 1987). It also suggests that a
fundamental feature of at least many properties is that they confer
causal capacities on their instances. Work on naturalistic ontology
doesn't entail detailed answers to every question about the nature of
properties, but it does suggest answers to some of them.
Existence Conditions: A natural, though
not inevitable, conclusion to draw from the work discussed in this
subsection is that properties exist only if they confer causal or
nomological capacities on their instances. For properties: to be is to
(be able to) confer causal capacities.
Identity Conditions: The most natural conclusion to
draw here is that properties are identical just in case they confer
exactly the same causal powers on their instances.
Structure: If N-relation theories are
right, the realm of properties is structured in at least the minimal
sense that many pairs of properties stand in one or more higher-order
nomological relations. Properties are also related to the causal powers
they confer on their instances in some intimate, though not clearly
understood, way.
Modal Status: If laws of nature are metaphysically
necessary, then properties that actually stand in the
N-relation stand in that relation in all possible worlds in
which they exist. The fact that properties confer causal powers on
their instances is also naturally understood as the claim that the
instances of a property have those powers in all possible worlds in
which that property exists.
Epistemic Status: Philosophers who employ
properties to provide explanations in naturalistic ontology typically
hold that we learn about properties empirically. On some accounts all
properties are instantiated, and we learn about them because their
instances affect our sensory apparatus or our measuring instruments. On
other accounts some properties are uninstantiated, but they are related
to properties that are instantiated in systematic ways. For example, a
specific determinate mass (e.g., 4 kg) might be uninstantiated, but we
can describe it quite precisely (as twice as great a mass as 2 kg,
which is, let us suppose, exemplified). Furthermore, we can say what
causal powers it would have conferred on its instances, had it had any
(e.g., we can say what gravitational force its instances would have
exerted on a 2 kg object 5 meters away).
At this point it is useful to step back to note the fundamental way
in which the general conception of properties discussed in
this subsection differs from many of the conceptions discussed earlier.
On those earlier conceptions at least many properties are causally
inert, other-worldly, abstract entities that exist outside space and
time; they are timeless, necessary beings, and since we cannot come
into causal contact with them, our knowledge of them is
problematic.
By contrast, the view that emerges from much of the work in
naturalistic ontology treats properties as contingent beings that are
intimately related to the causal, spatio-temporal order, and we learn
what properties there are and what they are like through empirical
investigation. Such properties are not much like meanings or concepts,
and so it is possible to discover that a property conceived of in one
way (e.g., the property of being water) is identical with a property
conceived in some quite different way (e.g., the property of being
H2O). It might be misleading to call such properties
‘concrete’ (the standard antonym of the slippery word
‘abstract’), but it isn't quite right to call them
‘abstract’ either. Indeed, the stark dichotomy between the
abstract and concrete is probably too simple to be useful here.
What properties are there? Under what conditions does a property exist?
In formal accounts — those modeled on axiomatic set theory or
axiomatic treatments of other mathematical entities — the goal is
typically to find formal principles (like
comprehension schemas)
that state sufficient (and, with luck, necessary) conditions for the
existence of properties. But the basic issues about the existence
conditions of properties are not really formal ones. Indeed, views
about their existence conditions typically derive from an interplay of
views about the explanatory tasks of properties and legitimate
constraints on philosophical explanation.
We can view the array of views about the existence conditions of
properties as a continuum, with claims that the realm of properties is
sparse over on the right (conservative) end and claims that it is
bountiful over on the left (liberal) end.
According to minimalist conceptions of properties, the realm of
properties is sparsely populated. This is a comparative claim (it is
more thinly populated than many realists suppose), rather than a claim
about cardinality. Indeed, a minimalist could hold that there is a
large infinite number of properties, say that there are at least as
many properties as real numbers. This would be a natural view, for
example, for a philosopher who thought that each value of a physical
magnitude is a separate property and that field theories of such
properties as gravitational potentials are correct in their claim that
the field intensity drops off continuously as we move away from the
source of the field.
The best-known contemporary exponent of minimalism is David
Armstrong (e.g., 1978, 1984, 1997), though it has also been defended by
others (e.g., Swoyer, 1996). Specific reductionist motivations (e.g., a
commitment to physicalism) can lead to minimalism, but here we will
focus on more general motivations. These motivations typically involve
some combination of the view that everything that exists at all exists
in space and time (or space-time), a desire for epistemic security, and
a distrust of modal notions like necessity. Hence, a minimalist is
likely to subscribe to at least most of the following four
principles.
The principle of instantiation says that there are no
uninstantiated properties. For properties: to be is to be exemplified.
Taken alone the principle of instantiation doesn't enforce a strong
version of minimalism, since it might be that a wide array of
properties are exemplified. For example, someone who thinks that
numbers or individual essences or other abstract objects exist would
doubtless think that a vast number of properties are exemplified. So it
is useful to distinguish two versions of the principle of
instantiation.
Weak Instantiation: All properties are
instantiated; there are no uninstantiated properties.
Strong Instantiation: All properties are
instantiated by things that exist in space and time (or, if properties
can themselves instantiate properties, each property is part of a
descending chain of instantiations that bottoms out in individuals in
space and time).
Armstrong (1978) holds that properties enjoy a timeless sort of
existence; if a property is ever instantiated, then it
always exists. A more rigorous minimalism holds that
properties are mortal; a property only exists when it is
exemplified. This account has an admirable purity about it, but it is
hard pressed to explain very much; for example, if laws are relations
among properties, then a law would seem to come and go as the
properties involved did.
Philosophers who subscribe to the strong principle of instantiation are
almost certain to hold that properties are contingent beings.
It is a contingent matter just which individuals exist and what
properties they happen to exemplify, so it is a contingent matter what
properties there are.
A natural consequence of the view that properties are contingent beings
is that questions about which properties exist are empirical. There are
no logical or conceptual or any other a priori methods to
determine which properties exist.
Those who hold that properties are very finely individuated will be
inclined to hold that the realm of properties is fairly bountiful. For
example, if the relation of loving and the converse of its
converse (and the converse of the converse of that, and so on) are
distinct, then properties will be plentiful. Minimalists, by contrast,
are more likely to hold that properties are identical just in case they
necessarily have the same instances or just in case they bestow the
same causal powers on their instances. On these views the converse of
the converse of a binary relation will just be that relation itself (we
will return to this matter in the section on
identity conditions
of properties).
The strong principle of instantiation opens the door to the claim
that properties are literally located in their instances. This is a
version of Medieval philosophers' doctrine of universalia in
rebus, which was contrasted with the picture of universalia
ante rem, the view that properties are transcendent beings that
exist apart from their instances. With properties firmly rooted here in
the spatio-temporal world, it may seem less mysterious how we could
learn about them, talk about them, and use them to provide illuminating
explanations. For it isn't some weird, other-worldly entity that
explains why this apple is red; it is something in the apple,
some aspect of it, that accounts for this. It is easier, however, to
think of monadic properties as located in their instances than it is to
view relations in this way (this may be why Aristotle and the moderate
realists of the middle ages viewed a relation as an accident that
inheres in a single thing). Nevertheless, the general feeling that
transcendent properties couldn't explain anything about their instances
has figured prominently in many debates over properties.
Minimalists must pay a price for their epistemic security (there's
no escaping the fundamental ontological tradeoff). They will have
little hope of finding enough properties for a semantic account of even
a modest fragment of any natural language and they will be hard pressed
(though Armstrong, 1997, does try) to use properties to account for
phenomena in the philosophy of mathematics. Minimalists may not be
greatly bothered by this, however, for many of them are primarily
concerned with issues in naturalistic ontology.
At the other, left, end of the spectrum we find maximalist conceptions
of properties. Borrowing a term from Arthur Lovejoy, maximalists argue
that properties obey a principle of plenitude. Every property
that could possibly exist does exist. For properties: To be is
to be possible (Linsky & Zalta, 1995; cf. Jubien, 1989). If one
accepts the view that properties are necessary beings, then it is a
simple modal fact that if a property is possible it is necessary and,
hence, actual.
Just as the principle of instantiation alone does not guarantee
minimalism, the principle of plenitude alone does not guarantee
maximalism. One can endorse the former while holding that all sorts of
properties are instantiated, and one can endorse the latter by holding
that very few properties are possible (an actualist who subscribed to
the strong principle of instantiation might hold this). So to get to
the maximalist end of the spectrum we need to add the claim that a vast
array of properties is possible. Various formal principles, e.g., a
strong comprehension principle (e.g., Zalta, 1988) and axioms ensuring
very finely-individuated properties (e.g., Bealer, 1982, p. 65; Menzel,
1986, p. 38) are two formal ways to achieve this.
Maximalist accounts are often propounded by philosophers who want to
explain meaning and mental content, but since such accounts postulate
so many properties that maximalists have the resources to offer
accounts of other things (e.g., phenomena in the foundations of
mathematics), and many do. Indeed, the great strength of maximalism is
that its enormously rich ontology offers the resources to explain all
sorts of things.
Epistemology is the Achilles' heel of maximalism. At least some
philosophers find it difficult to see how our minds could make
epistemic contact (and how our words could make semantic contact) with
entities lying outside the spatio-temporal, causal order. But
maximalism has its advantages. Those maximalists who are untroubled by
epistemic angst typically remain maximalists. By contrast, philosophers
who begin as minimalists sometimes feel pressure to move to a richer
conception of properties, either to extend their explanations to cover
more phenomena or, sometimes, even just to adequately explain the
things they started out trying to explain (e.g., Armstrong's more
recent work is somewhat less minimalist than his earliest work).
There is a large middle ground between extreme minimalism and extreme
maximalism. For example, several philosophers primarily concerned with
physical ontology have urged that a limited number of uninstantiated
properties are needed to account for features of measurement (Mundy,
1987), vectors (Bigelow and Pargetter, 1990, p. 77), or natural laws
(Tooley, 1987). Such accounts can, like minimalism, treat properties as
contingent, fairly coarsely individuated, and too sparse to satisfy any
general comprehension principles (e.g., they may deny that there are
negative or disjunctive properties). One can also arrive at a centrist
position by endorsing a comprehension principle but adding that it only
guarantees the existence of properties built up from an initial,
sparse, stock of simple properties (cf. Bealer, 1994, p. 167).
Being moderate isn't always easy, and it can be difficult to stake
out a position in the center that doesn't appear arbitrary. Once
any uninstantiated properties are admitted, we are in much the
same epistemological boat as the maximalist. No doubt the minimalist
will see this as a reason to reject any uninstantiated properties,
while the maximalist (who believes that epistemological problems can be
overcome) will see it as a reason to admit as many as possible.
There is some reason to think that accounts in different fields (e.g.,
semantics and natural ontology) may call for entities with different
identity conditions; for example, semantics requires very finely
individuated properties whereas naturalist ontology may need more
coarsely individuated ones. If this is so, then no single kind of
entity could do both kinds of jobs. The minimalist is likely to
conclude that it is a mistake to employ properties in semantics. But
less squeamish philosophers may instead conclude that there are (at
least) two different sorts of property-like entities. Bealer's (1982)
qualities and concepts and Lewis's (1986) sparse and abundant
properties are examples of this approach. But this happy hybrid won't
satisfy everyone, since minimalists (and some centrists) will reject
the view that there are any concepts or abundant properties.
Disputes over the existence conditions of properties splinter into
several related, but distinct, issues.
- Instantiation issues: Must a property be exemplified to exist?
- Localization Issues: Do exemplified properties exist in space and
time (namely where they are instantiated)?
- Modal issues: Are properties contingent beings or are at least some
necessary beings?
- Epistemological issues: Is the only way to discover the existence
of properties though empirical means?
- Individuation issues: How finely individuated are properties?
Minimalists hold that all properties are contingent beings,
that they must be exemplified in space and time to exist, that we can
only discover their existence empirically, and that they are fairly
coarsely individuated. Some minimalists also hold that they exist in
those locations where they are instantiated. Maximalists reject all of
these views. These two sets of views form fairly natural packages, but
other combinations are possible, and they lead to views falling between
the two extremes.
What are the identity conditions for properties? An answer would give
us necessary and sufficient conditions for the properties x
and y to be one and the same property. Another way to pose the
question is to ask how finely individuated properties are, and here we
find a spectrum of views.
- Infra-coarse: Properties with the same extension
are the same properties (this holds for Frege's concepts, but all
contemporary property theories reject this claim; it is included simply
as a point of reference).
- Medium coarse: Properties are identical just in
case they necessarily have the same extension.
- Medium Fine:
- Properties are identical just in case they confer the same causal
or, more generally, the same nomological powers on their instances
(i.e., they are identical if they play the same functional role),
or
- Properties are identical just in case they are encoded by exactly
the same abstract objects (Zalta)
- Ultra-fine: Properties are individuated almost as
finely as the linguistic expressions that express them. A natural way
to work this out is to develop an account of the analysis of a property
and to hold that properties are identical just in case they have the
same analysis (cf. Bealer's account of concepts; Menzel, 1993).
On most medium-fine views, formal considerations alone do not determine
identity conditions for properties.
Probably the best-know candidate for an identity condition for
properties is necessary coextensiveness. This seems to transpose the
identity conditions for sets into an appropriately intensional key, and
this is precisely how identity conditions for properties work in
accounts that treat them as
intensions
(as
functions from possible worlds to objects therein). Bealer also views
this as the identity condition for his sparse properties, qualities and
connections (though he is undogmatic about this).
Although necessary coextension may be the most-discussed candidate
identity condition for properties, many realists reject it because it
doesn't comport well with the explanations they want to develop.
Identity conditions don't matter greatly when the aim is simply to
explain mathematical phenomena; even extensional entities like sets
could do that job, so we don't need necessary coextension as an
identity condition here. This proposal is also in tension with the
picture that properties are individuated by their functional roles, at
least on the assumption that necessarily coextensive properties can
confer different causal powers on their instances (Sober, 1982,
contains a strong argument that this can happen, though the jury is
probably still out on this issue). And in semantics we need
hyper-intensional properties that are individuated much more finely
than the necessary-coextension condition allows.
The view that properties are identical just in case they confer the
same causal, or more generally, the same nomological or functional
roles on their instances has been endorsed by various philosophers who
work primarily in scientific ontology. On this conception, there are
few, if any, purely formal identity conditions for properties (unless,
as seems unlikely, someone devises a purely formal account of causal
roles). One cost of this view is that the notion of a causal role and
the relationship between such roles and properties is not completely
clear.
We have encountered all of the major current views about the identity
conditions of properties except for one in previous sections, so we
will go into it in a bit more detail here. The encoding account of
property identity, proposed in Zalta (1983; 1988), is developed in
the context of a rich theory of properties that goes along with a rich
theory of abstract objects. In this theory, ordinary objects (like Bill
Clinton) exist, exemplify properties, but cannot encode properties. By
contrast (on the most common interpretation of his system), abstract
objects (like Pegasus and the Euclidean triangle) exist necessarily,
but they necessarily fail to have a spatio-temporal location. Abstract
objects encode, as well as exemplify, properties; indeed, an abstract
object is constituted by the properties it encodes. For
example, the abstract object the Euclidean triangle encodes all and
only those properties implied by being a triangle of Euclidean geometry
(e.g., being a closed three-side plane figure whose interior angles sum
to 180 degrees). This abstract object also exemplifies properties,
e.g., being mentioned in all textbooks on plane geometry.
The metaphysical theory of abstract objects is linked to our actual
thought and talk by the bridge principle that the English copula is
ambiguous; sometimes ‘is’ means ‘exemplifies’,
sometimes ‘encodes’. The existence condition for abstract
objects is given by a comprehension schema according to which there is
(necessarily) a unique abstract object that encodes just those
properties satisfying each condition on properties specifiable in the
language of the theory, and abstract objects are identical just in case
they encode exactly the same properties. More importantly, for current
purposes, properties are identical just in case they are, necessarily
and always, encoded by exactly the same individuals.
On this account, properties that necessarily have the same
encoding extensions are identical, but properties
that necessarily have the same exemplification extensions may
be distinct. To see the difference, note that the property of
being a round square and the property of being a round triangle
necessarily have the same exemplification extension. Hence, accounts
(like those noted in
§6.3)
that treat necessary
(exemplification) coextension as sufficient for identity tell us that
they are one and the same property. But since these properties have
different encoding extensions, the present account treats them as
distinct. One can even make this work without any actual abstract
objects, though the nonidentity of two properties would still require
that there could have been an abstract object that encodes one
but not the other. This is one of the few novel accounts of property
identity to be proposed in recent decades. It has the virtue of being
part of a detailed theory that has been employed to explain a wide
range of phenomena, and it expresses the identity conditions for
properties in terms of one of their most fundamental features, namely
that they are predicable entities. The price is that it requires us to
hold that there are two modes of predication and that there are, or at
least that there could have been, abstract objects.
The view that properties have ultra-fine identity conditions is
typically developed in the context of a rich formal theory of
properties. One could mandate fine-grained identity conditions by brute
force, e.g., by laying down axioms that each set of objects is in the
extension of more than one property, or in the extension of many
different properties. But the intuitive idea behind property theories
tailored to semantics is that there are "compound properties" which are
built up from simpler properties by logical operations akin to
conjunction, negation, and so on. On such accounts the property
being red and square is distinct (because built up in a
different way) from the property being square and red.
Similarly, the converse of the converse of a two-place relation is
distinct from that relation itself.
Such accounts may be well-suited for explaining strongly intensional
phenomena (like belief sentences or mental content), but they also
raise certain questions. For example, what is the difference between
the property being red and square and the distinct property
being square and red, and what allows us to link the right
complex predicate (say ‘is red and square’) to the right
property (being red and square) rather than to the wrong one
(being square and red)? If properties literally had parts, the
answer might be that the arrangements of things in the two properties
is different (e.g., being red comes "first" in being red
and square). Explaining what such structural differences amount to
would not be easy, but at least such differences might point to the
beginnings of a solution. By contrast, if properties lack genuine
internal structure, it is less clear how an account of the difference
between being red and square and being square and red
would even begin. We will return briefly to such matters in the
final section.
Most realists agree that there are various sorts of properties, and in
this section we will review the main kinds of properties they have
proposed. But many realists are also selective; they believe that some,
but not all, of these kinds of properties exist. Indeed, almost
none of the putative kinds of properties discussed here is
accepted by all realists, but to avoid constant qualifications (like
‘putative kind of property’) I will present each sort of
property as though it were unproblematic.
The first set of issues we will examine involve the most fundamental
logical or structural features of properties. We will begin with a
picture of a hierarchy of properties arranged according to order.
First-order properties and relations are those that can only be
instantiated by individuals. For example redness can be
instantiated by the apple on my desk and being married to can
be instantiated by Bill and Hillary, but no properties can be red or
married. It is natural to suppose, however, that at least many
first-order properties and relations can themselves have properties and
relations. For example, redness might be thought to exemplify
the property of being a color and being married to
might be thought to exemplify the property of being a symmetrical
relation. Once we think of second-order properties, it is natural
to wonder whether there are third-order properties (properties of
second- or, perhaps in cumulative fashion, of second- and
first-order properties), and so on up through ever-higher orders.
This metaphysical picture finds a formal parallel in higher-order
logics. On one common system of classification, we move from familiar
first-order logic to second-order logic by adding first-order
variables, from second- to third-order logic by adding second-order
constants, from third- to fourth-order logic by adding second-order
variables, and so on up, alternating constants and variables at
successive steps.
Realists differ over which niches in this proposed hierarchy of
orders are occupied. Proponents of the
empirical conception
of properties will hold that it is an empirical question
whether there are second- or forth- or fifty-seventh-order properties.
The issue for them is likely to be whether putative higher-order
properties confer any causal powers on their instances over and above
those already conferred by lower-order properties. But it is also
possible to have less empirically motivated views about which parts of
the hierarchy are occupied.
Elementarism (Bergmann, 1968) is the view that there are
first-order properties but that there are no properties of any
higher-order. There are first-order properties like various shades of
red, but there is no higher-order property (like being a
color) that such properties share nor are they related by any
higher-order relations (like being darker than).
Elementarism has sometimes been defended by appealing to something
like Russell's principle of acquaintance, the tenet that only
things with which we are acquainted should be thought to exist,
together with the claim that we are acquainted with first-order
properties but not with those of any higher orders. To the extent that
first-order properties are able to perform all of the tasks that
properties are called on to do, elementarism could also be defended on
grounds of parsimony. But it is now widely acknowledged, even by
minimalists, that at the very least some higher-order relations are
needed to confer structure on first-order properties.
In May of 1901 Russell discovered his famous paradox. If every
predicative expression determines or corresponds to a property, then
the expressions ‘is a property that does not instantiate
itself’ should do so. This raises the question: does this
property instantiate itself? Suppose that it does. Then it is
a property that does not instantiate itself; so if it does instantiate
itself, it doesn't instantiate itself. Now suppose that it does
not instantiate itself. Then it is one of those properties
that does not instantiate itself; so it does instantiate itself. Such a
property, which instantiates itself if and only if it does not
instantiate itself, cannot exist (on pain of contradiction). This led
Russell to introduce a theory of types which institutes a total ban on
self-exemplification by a strict segregation of properties into orders
(his account is actually even more restrictive than this; see the entry
on
Russell's paradox
for details).
Russell's reaction seems extreme, because many cases of
self-exemplification are innocuous. Furthermore, realists who are not
minimalists or conservative centrists are likely to think that
self-exemplification is common. For example, the property of being a
property is itself a property, so it exemplifies itself. There also
seem to be transcendental properties and relations. A transcendental
relation like thinks about is one that can relate quite
different types of things: Hans can think about Vienna and he can think
about triangularity. But typed theories cannot accommodate
transcendental properties without several epicycles.
Several recent accounts (e.g., Bealer, 1982; Menzel, 1993) treat
properties as entities that can exemplify themselves. From this
perspective, the picture of a hierarchy of orders is fundamentally
misguided; there are simply properties (which can be exemplified
— in many cases by other properties, even by themselves) and
individuals (which cannot be exemplified). One challenge here is to
develop
formal accounts
that allow as much
self-exemplification as possible without teetering over the brink into
paradox. In formal systems where abstract singular terms or predicates
may (but need not) denote properties (cf. Swoyer, 1998), formal
counterparts of (complex) predicates like ‘being a property that
does not exemplify itself’ could exist in the object language
without denoting properties; from this perspective Russell's paradox
would merely show that this predicate lacked a denotation, rather than
that the logic was inconsistent.
We have treated relations as properties (with more than one argument
place); for example the properties of loving and being
shorter than are two-place relations, that of being in
between (two other things) is a three-place relation, and so
on. On abundant conceptions of properties, there are relations of every
finite number of argument places, but on sparse conceptions it is an
empirical question whether there are relations of any particular degree
(i.e., with any particular number of argument places). What we think of
as genuine relations were not recognized by philosophers until about a
century and a half ago (with the work of DeMorgan, Schroeder, and
Peirce and, somewhat later, Russell). Until then relations were treated
as a special sort of monadic property (when they were acknowledged at
all).
We have seen how several selective realisms focus on the hierarchy
of orders, but selective realisms can also focus on the degree
(the number of argument places) of relations. Leibniz argued that
relations could be reduced to monadic properties (though he never
really explained just how this was to work) and so were dispensable.
Some philosophers still hold that relations supervene on the monadic
properties of their relata in a very strong sense that shows that
relations are not actually real (some trope theorists hold this view;
it is defended at length in Fisk, 1972). But no one has been able to
show that all relations do supervene on monadic properties, and there
are strong reasons for thinking that at least some sorts of relations,
e.g., spatio-temporal ones, do not. Hence, most contemporary realists
hold that there are genuine relations.
Other selective realisms are possible. For example, in contrast with
Leibniz's view one might hold that there are relations but no monadic
properties (this view is sometimes attributed, with very little textual
support, to Peirce). And Armstrong (1978, ch. 24) proposes the
tentative hypothesis that there are first- and second-level monadic
properties, but no monadic properties of any higher-level.
Many predicates are multigrade or variably polyadic;
they can be true of various numbers of things. For example, the
predicate ‘robbed a bank together’ is true of Bonnie and
Clyde, Ma Barker and her two boys, Patti Hearst and three members of
the Symbionese Liberation Army, and so on. Multigrade predicates are
very common (e.g., ‘work well together’, ‘conspired
to commit murder’, ‘are lovers’). Some of them can be
analyzed as conjunctions of fixed-degree predicates, but many of them
cannot. Standard logic does not accommodate multigrade predicates, but
they are very common, and if the goal is to use properties as semantic
values of English predicates, then multigrade properties are needed.
They have also been used in naturalistic ontology in an ingenious
treatment of measurement (Mundy, 1989). A truly flexible account of
properties would abandon both the restrictive hierarchy of orders and
the equally restrictive view that all properties come with a fixed
number of argument places, but as yet little work of this sort has been
done.
In ancient and Medieval times propositions were not seen as a special
kind of property (in those days philosophers didn't even recognize
genuine autonomous relations), and many contemporary philosophers who
focus on physical ontology or philosophy of mathematics do not regard
propositions as a kind of property (many of them doubt that there are
any such things). But those who work on the semantics of natural
language often postulate the existence of propositions, noting that we
can think of them as a limiting case of a property. Consider a
two-place property like loves and think of plugging one of its
open places up with Darla to obtain the one-place property loves
Darla. If we can do this, it is sometimes argued, then we can plug
the remaining (last) open place up with Sam to get the zero-place
property, or proposition, that Sam loves Darla.
Some philosophers (e.g., Grossman, 1983, §§58-61) argue that
all properties are simple. Others argue that there is a distinction
between simple properties and compound properties,
that some compound properties exist, and that they have a structure
that involves or incorporates simpler properties. Properties might have
different sorts of structure, including various sorts of algebraic or
logical structure. Because such issues often arise in connection with
formal accounts of properties, this issue is discussed in the section
on
formal theories
of properties.
If instantiation or exemplification is just another run-of-the-mill
relation, it appears to lead to a vicious regress. This is often known
as Bradley's regress, although it is doubtful that Bradley
himself had this particular regress in mind. The construal of the
Bradley's regress that has passed into the literature goes like this.
Suppose that the individual a has the property F. For
a to instantiate F it must be linked to
F by a relation of instantiation, I. But (here's
where the trouble begins), this requires a further pair of relations,
R1 and R2, one to connect
a to I and a second to connect I to
F. This in turn requires four additional relations to bind
R1 and R2 to the things that
they are supposed to relate, then eight further relations to fasten
these four relations to their relata, and so on without end. It is
sometimes suggested that the regress is innocuous, but the problem
isn't simply that there is a regress. The problem is that at each
"stage" further relations are required, but they are never
able to link their would-be relata. The difficulty is that nothing
ever gets connected to anything else.
The only way to avoid this difficulty is to insist that
instantiation is not a relation, at least not a normal one. Some
philosophers hold that it is a sui generis linkage that hooks
things up without intermediaries. Strawson (1959), following W. E.
Johnson, calls it a non-relational tie; others stress that it
is a mode of predication. It may even be that there is no such thing as
instantiation at all and that talk of it is just a misleading figure of
speech. At this point it is natural to resort to metaphors like Frege's
claim that properties have gaps that can be filled by objects or the
early Wittgenstein's suggestion (if we read him as a realist about
properties) that objects and properties can be hooked together like
links in a chain. Broad likened instantiation to Metaphysical Glue,
noting that when we glue two sheets of paper together we don't need
additional glue, or mortar, or some other adhesive to bind the glue to
the paper (Broad 1933, p.85). Glue just sticks. And instantiation just
relates. It is metaphysically self-adhesive.
Some properties are metaphysical analogues of count nouns. They have
been called sortal properties (by Strawson) and
particularizing properties (by Armstrong), but the ideas
involved here have a long history. Strawson borrows the word
‘sortal’ from Locke, and at least some particularizing
properties correspond closely to Aristotle's secondary substances.
Particularizing properties provide counting principles, or principles
on identity, in the sense that they allow us to count objects. For
example, the properties of being a table and being a
cat are particularizing properties; there are definite facts of
the matter as to how many tables are in the kitchen and how many cats
are on those tables. There are also properties, e.g.,
intervention, bombing, that particularize events.
Particularizing properties are naturally contrasted with
characterizing properties. Characterizing properties like
redness and triangularity do not divide the world up
into a definite number of things. To the extent that a property like
redness seems to allow us to count red things, it is because
we are relying on the umbrella count noun ‘thing’ to help
with the count.
Particularizing properties may also be contrasted with mass
properties. These are properties, like water,
gold, and furniture, that apply to stuff. Like
characterizing properties, mass properties do not divide the world up
into definite numbers of things, but many characterizing properties
apply to individuals, whereas mass properties apply to stuff. It was
noted
above
that different sorts of linguistic
categories that might correspond to important ontological distinctions
are run together we represent all of them as predicates of a formal
language. It now appears, for example, that common nouns express
particularizing properties, while adjectives typically express
characterizing properties.
Although the notions of genus and species play a
relatively small role in contemporary metaphysics, they figured
prominently in Aristotle's philosophy and in the many centuries of work
inspired by it. When we construe these notions as properties (rather
than as linguistic expressions), a genus is a general property and a
species is a more specific subtype of it. The distinction is typically
thought to be a relative one: being a mammal is a species
relative to the genus being an animal, but it is a genus
relative to the species being a donkey. It has usually been
assumed that in such chains there is a top-most, absolute genus, and a
bottom-most, absolute species.
It was traditionally supposed that a species could be uniquely
specified or defined in terms of a genus and a differentia. For
example, the property being a human is completely determined
by the properties being an animal (genus) and being
rational (differentia). It is difficult, by today's lights, to
draw a principled distinction between genera and differentiae, but the
idea that species properties are
compound,
conjunctive properties remains a natural one. For example, the property
of being a human might be identified with the conjunctive
property being a human and being rational. But it is now
rarely assumed, as it was for many centuries, that all compound
properties are conjunctive.
The concepts of determinables and determinates were
popularized by the Cambridge philosopher W. E. Johnson. Properties like
color and shape are determinables, while more
specific versions of these properties (like redness and
octagonality) are determinates. Like the distinction between
genus and species, the distinction between determinables and
determinates is a relative one; redness is a determinate with respect
to color but a determinable with respect to specific shades of red. The
hierarchy is generally thought to bottom out, however, in completely
specific, absolute determinates.
Species are often thought to be definable in terms of a genus and a
differentia. But determinates are not definable in terms of a
determinable and a differentia; indeed, they are not conjunctive
properties of any obvious sort. Determinates under the same
determinable are incompatible; nothing can instantiate both of them at
the same time, and anything that exemplifies a determinate must
exemplify its determinables as well. The distinction between
determinables and determinates has played a larger role in recent
metaphysics than the more venerable distinction between genus and
species. For example, much recent work in
naturalistic ontology
treats physical
magnitudes as absolute determinate properties (like being a mass of
3 kg or being a force of 17 newtons) falling under
determinables like mass and force.
Any object that instantiates a determinate (e.g. red) must have the
corresponding determinable (e.g., color), and Armstrong has raised the
question whether determinables are genuine properties or whether we
simply apply determinable predicates to things on the basis of the
determinate properties that they have. The determinable properties of a
thing (if there are any), are necessarily
supervenient
on the determinates of the
thing, in the sense that two things that have exactly the same
determinates must also have exactly the same determinables. For
example, if two things exemplify the same determinate mass, then both
must have a mass. Armstrong (1997, p. 45) urges that this issue is part
of a more general issue as to whether necessarily supervenient
properties are anything over and above the properties on which they
supervene. His answer is that they are not; they are a "metaphysical
free lunch." He offers little argument for this claim, however, and
many philosophers would demur.
Natural Kind Properties are important properties that carve
nature at its natural joints. Paradigms include the property of being a
specific sort of elementary particle (e.g., the property of being a
neutron), chemical element (e.g., the property of being gold), and
biological species (e.g., the property of being a jackal). Natural
kinds are often contrasted with artificial kinds (e.g., being a central
processing unit).
In recent years a good deal of work has been done on the semantics
of natural kind terms (involving such issues as whether they are rigid
designators). Less work has been done on the ontology of natural kinds,
but it is clear that it is most plausible to speak of natural kinds in
those cases where something has what Locke called a real
essence (in the way that elementary particles or chemical elements
probably do). In these cases it seems plausible to suppose that natural
kind properties are
compound properties
that
involve simpler properties (e.g., the quantum numbers, for elementary
particles; being made of simpler parts standing in specific relations
in the way that chemical elements are made up of atoms related by
chemical bondings).
The distinctions between natural and artificial kinds and that
between particularizing and mass properties are orthogonal to each
other. Some natural kind properties, e.g., being a dog, are
particularizing while others, e.g., gold, are not. Likewise,
some artificial properties, e.g., being a table, are
particularizing while others, e.g., furniture, are not. The
chief issue here is whether there are any natural kinds or whether our
classifications are primarily a matter of cultural and linguistic
conventions that represent just one of many ways of classifying things
(so that joints are a result of the way that we happen to carve things
up).
Some properties involve or incorporate particulars. The properties of
being identical with Harry and being in love with
Harry involve Harry. Even those who think that lots of properties
exist necessarily often believe that non-qualitative properties like
this are contingent; they depend upon Harry, and they only exist in
circumstances in which he exists. By contrast, purely qualitative
properties (like being a unit negative charge or being in
love) do not involve individuals in this way. The distinction
between properties that are purely qualitative and those that are not
is usually easy to draw in practice, but a precise characterization of
it is elusive.
A (monadic) property is an essential property of an individual just in
case that individual has the property in every possible circumstance in
which the individual exists. Essential properties are contrasted with
accidental properties, properties that things just happen, quite
contingently, to have. My car is red but it could have been blue (had I
painted it), so its color is an accidental property. It is doubtless an
essential property of my car that it is extended, but interesting
examples of essential properties are more controversial — so
controversial that some philosophers have doubted whether there are
any. It is sometimes suggested, though, that if something is a member
of a natural kind, then being a member of that kind is essential to it;
for example, being human is an essential property of Saul
Kripke.
The phrase ‘internal relation’ has been used in
different ways, but it is often used as the relational analogue of an
essential (monadic) property. For example, if a bears the
relation R to b, then R internally relates
a to b just in case a bears this relation to
b in every possible circumstance in which they both exist.
Relations that are not internal, that contingently link their relata
(the things they relate), are external. Bill and Hillary are married,
but they might not have been, so this relation between them is
external. By contrast, some philosophers have suggested that the
relation being a biological parent of is an internal relation.
In every world in which Bill and Chelsea both exist, Bill is her
father. If this is correct, then the relational property, being a
child of Bill is essential to Chelsea, but being the father of
Chelsea is not essential to Bill (he and Hillary might never have
met, in which case they would not have had Chelsea).
Some properties are instantiated by individuals because of the
relations they bear to other things. For example the property being
married is instantiated by Bill Clinton because he is married
to Hillary Clinton. Such properties are sometimes called
extrinsic or relational properties. Objects have them
because of their relations to other things. By contrast,
intrinsic or non-relational properties are properties
that a thing has quite independently of its relationships to other
things. Many properties that seem to be intrinsic turn out to be
extrinsic when we examine them carefully. The main questions here are
whether there are any interesting intrinsic properties and how the
notions of intrinsicness and extrinsicness are to be explicated.
The distinction between primary and secondary properties goes back to
the Greek atomists. It lay dormant for centuries, but was revived by
Galileo, Descartes, Boyle, Locke, and others during the seventeenth
century. Locke's influence is so pervasive that such properties still
often go under the names he gave them, primary and
secondary qualities.
The intuitive idea is that primary properties are objective features
of the world; on many accounts they are also fundamental properties
that explain why things have the other properties that they do. Early
lists of primary properties included shape, size, and
(once Newton's influence was absorbed) mass. Today we might
add properties like charge, spin or the
four-vectors of special relativity to the list of primary
properties. By contrast, secondary properties somehow depend on the
mind; standard lists of secondary properties include colors,
tastes, sounds, and smells. On Locke's
account secondary properties are powers of objects that are rooted in
the primary properties. The most pressing question about the two kinds
of properties is how (if at all) a precise and informative distinction
can be drawn between them. Issues involving primary and secondary
properties have been revived in the recent flurry of discussions of
color.
Supervenience is sometimes taken to be a relationship between two
fragments of language (e.g., between psychological vocabulary and
physical vocabulary), but it is increasingly taken to be a relationship
between pairs of families of properties. To say that
psychological properties supervene on physical properties, for example,
is to say that, necessarily, everything that has any psychological
properties also has physical properties and any two things that have
exactly the same physical properties will have exactly the same
psychological properties. There are no differences in psychological
properties without some difference in physical properties.
There is no consensus as to how globally to construe supervenience
claims. In the case of psychological and physical properties it seems
too narrow to say that the non-relational psychological properties of a
person supervene on her non-relational physical properties (too many
important psychological properties involve relationships to things
outside the organism for this to be right). And it seems unhelpfully
narrow just to say that any two worlds that are just alike in their
distributions of physical properties will be just alike in their
distributions of psychological properties. But however we phrase the
doctrine (and no doubt different versions will be useful for different
purposes), supervenience is very naturally construed as a relation
between pairs of families of properties.
In some cases it also seems plausible to think of the supervenient
realm as linguistic and the supporting, subvenient realm in terms of
properties: there can be no difference in truths in the upper realm
(e.g., those employing psychological vocabulary) without a difference
in properties (e.g., physical properties) at the lower level. But this
hybrid approach has not received much attention.
We might arrive at a notion of fictional properties in the
following way. In Naming and Necessity Kripke discusses what
he calls ‘mythical species’ (1980, pp. 156-158). On
Kripke's view, ‘Sherlock Holmes’ does not denote anyone,
neither an actual individual or a merely possible one. The name fails
to denote because all our descriptions of Holmes are essentially
incomplete. They do not fully specify a unique person (not even a
unique merely possible person), and so there are many different
possible detectives who have all of the properties ascribed to Holmes
but who differ in other ways. No one of them has any more claim on
being Holmes than any of the rest, and so there are no counterfactual
situations that could correctly be described as ones in which Holmes
exists.
The properties ascribed to unicorns are similarly incomplete. There
are many different possible species that have the properties we
commonly ascribe to unicorns but which differ in other ways. No one of
these species has any more claim on being unicorns than any of the
rest, and so there are no counterfactual situations that could
correctly be described as ones in which unicorns exists. It may also be
the case, though Kripke doesn't discuss the matter, that notions like
phlogiston and caloric fluid are similarly incomplete, and that there
are no counterfactual situations that could correctly be described as
ones in which anything has the property of being phlogiston or
that of being caloric fluid. But even if this further claim
isn't true, Kripke's example of unicorns suggests that there may be a
distinction between actual properties and fictional properties. There
are interesting philosophical issues about fictional characters,
individuals like Holmes and Pegasus and the bride of Frankenstein, and
there may be similarly interesting questions about fictional
properties. Aside from Zalta (1983), however, little work has been done
on this topic.
In this section I will explain some of the most rudimentary ideas
behind several recent formal theories of properties. The aim is to
convey the intuitive flavor of this work, so I will proceed primarily
by example rather than with definitions and proofs (interested readers
can find plenty of both in the works cited below).
There are several important choices that must be made in devising a
formal theory of properties; they include the following:
- Should the account be developed as a formal theory in a familiar
logic (in the way set theories are now standardly axiomatized in
standard first-order logic)? This was the approach in the early formal
theories of Barcan-Marcus (1963) and Lemmon (1963), who used
first-order modal logic (see Jubien, 1989, for a recent, more
sophisticated (and non-modal) implementation of this approach).
Alternatively, should a formal account of properties be developed as a
richer "logic of properties" (e.g., Bealer, 1982; Zalta, 1983; Menzel,
1993; Swoyer, 1998)?
- Should we employ a typed or an untyped conception of properties
(the latter is much more flexible, but it must be handled with care to
avoid paradox)?
- Should we make provisions for complex predicates (or complex
singular terms, or both) with something akin to a logical
structure?
- Should we require all of the expressions in the syntactic
categories that can denote (or express) properties to do so or should
we allow some or all of them not to?
Different choices are recommended by different conceptions of
properties. For the sake of exposition I will begin with those choices
that minimize the departures from familiar logical systems like
non-modal first-order logic. This means a logic of properties that is
typed, that does not include complex properties, and in which every
predicate expresses a property. We will then see how to extend this
approach in various ways.
Think of your favorite formulation of first-order logic with identity.
Then just add n-place predicate variables (for all positive
integers n) to its syntax and count any n-place
predicate variable followed by n individual terms (i.e., by
individual variables and constants) as a formula. Finally, allow
n-place predicate variables to be bound by quantifiers
containing an n-place predicate variable (in just the same way
that individual variables can be), and count formulas with no free
variables as sentences. For example, the expression
‘X3abc’ is a formula
consisting of the three-place predicate variable
‘X3’ followed by the three individual
terms ‘a’, ‘b’, and
‘c’; since the predicate variable is unbound, this
formula is not a sentence. By contrast,
‘(∃X2)X2ab’
is a sentence (here ‘∃’ is the existential
quantifier; this sentence says that there is at least one two-place
relation that relates a to b or, more idiomatically,
that a stands in some binary relation to b).
We interpret languages in this logical system over Intensional
Relational Structures (IRSs). An IRS is an
ordered triple:
I = <
DI,
DP,
ext >,
where DI
and DP are
non-empty, non-overlapping sets. On intended interpretations (which we
will take for granted here)
DI is the
domain of individuals and
DP is the
domain of properties (including relations).
DP is in
turn the union of an infinite number of non-overlapping, non-empty
sets:
1DP
(the set of one-place properties),
2DP
(the set of two-place relations),
3DP
(the set of three-place relations), and so on for each positive integer
n. Finally, ext is an extension assignment
function; it assigns an extension to every property in the property
domain DP
in accordance with the following rule:
Where Pn is an
n-place property, ext assigns
Pn a (possibly empty) set of
ordered n-tuples whose members are drawn from the individual
domain
DI
(we take an ordered one-tuple whose member is a to be
a itself). Hence, the extension assignment assigns each
one-place property a subset of the individual domain, each two-place
property (i.e., each binary relation) a set of ordered pairs on
individuals, and so on. In other words, it assigns exactly the same
sorts of extensions to n-place properties that interpretations
in standard first-order logic assign to n-place predicates.
Finally,
a
model or interpretation on an IRS interprets
our formal language over it. It assigns a denotation to each individual
constant (exactly as in standard first-order logic) and an
n-place property to each n-place predicate (here we
go beyond standard first-order logic). The fundamental idea is just
that:
- An atomic sentence like
‘F1a’, is true in the
model just in case the object denoted by ‘a’
is in the extension of the property denoted by
‘F1’,
- An atomic sentence like
‘F2ab’, is true in the
model just in case the ordered pair containing the objects denoted
by ‘a’ and ‘b’ (in that
order) is in the extension of the (two-place) property denoted by
‘F2’,
- ...and so on.1
As in first-order logic, we must add variable assignments (or their
equivalents) to explain the workings of quantifiers. A variable
assignment assigns an object of the appropriate sort to each variable
of the language (it assigns individuals to individual variables,
one-place properties to one-place predicate variables, two-place
properties (binary relations) to two-place predicate variables, and so
on). We then define satisfaction conditions for formulas (in a model
and relative to a variable assignment) just as we do in standard
first-order logic. Finally, a formula is true in a model just in case
it contains no unbound variables and is satisfied by every variable
assignment with respect to the model; a sentence is valid if is true in
all models; and a set of sentences entails a sentence if that sentence
is true in every model in which all of the sentences in the set are
true. It is routine to extend such logics to higher orders, so that
first-level properties can have second-level properties and stand in
second-order relations, and so on up.
Philosophers, linguists, and computer scientists have increasingly
chafed under the inflexible aspects of typed theories, and several
recent accounts treat properties as individuals that are included in
the range of the quantifiers for ordinary individuals. One way to
accommodate this approach is to modify IRSs so that they
include just a single domain that contains both properties and
individuals. We then introduce n-place property-designating
singular terms and require that an interpretation assign them
denotations of the appropriate sort. For example, a one-place term of
this sort might be used to represent the word ‘honesty’,
and a three-place term of this sort might be used to represent
‘betweeness’. We can still allow predicates to denote
properties (or we can introduce a new semantic relation,
expression, which assigns properties to predicates). This
allows something akin to self predication; if ‘F’
denotes (or expresses) the same property that the one-place singular
term ‘a’ denotes, then ‘Fa’
will be true just in case the property denoted by
‘a’ is in the extension of itself. Quite intricate
variations on this basic theme are possible; the most detailed is
Bealer's (1982) first-order intensional logic that includes intensional
abstracts among its singular terms.
It is much easier to deal with some features of natural language if we
include complex predicates in our language and introduce a systematic
way of interpreting them over IRSs. In the 1970s it occurred
to several people that a rigorous formal system embodying this
conception of properties could be constructed by investing the
operations on linguistic expression in systems like Quine's predicate
functor logic (1960) with an extra-linguistic, ontological status
(e.g., Bealer, 1973, 1982; McMichael & Zalta, 1981; Leeds, 1978).
Adding the machinery necessary to accommodate all of the complex
predicates we might want is quite intricate (see Zalta, 1983 for a very
readable account), and here I will just mention two examples to convey
the general idea.
The first step is to introduce a variable-binding operator,
λ, that allows us to construct complex predicates from open
formulas. For example, we can apply ‘λ’ to the open
formula, ‘Rx & Sx’ to form the
one-place complex predicate
‘[λx (Rx &
Sx)]’; if ‘R’ denotes being
red and ‘S’ denotes being square,
then this complex predicate denotes the compound, conjunctive property
being red and square (a stilted, but sometimes useful
rendering of this is ‘the property of being a thing that is both
red and square’). Similarly, we can apply the operator to the
open formula ‘∃y(Lxy)’ to form the
one-place predicate ‘[λx
∃y(Lxy)]’; if ‘L’
stands for loves, this complex predicate denotes the compound
property loving someone (whereas
‘[λy
∃x(Lxy)]’ would denote being loved by
someone).2
Although the guiding ideas here are relatively straightforward,
considerable delicacy is required to ensure that everything works out
in precisely the right way. For example, an object should exemplify the
conjunctive property denoted by
‘[λx (Rx &
Sx)]’ if and only if it exemplifies both the properties
R and S. And an object should exemplify the property
denoted by ‘[λy
∃x(Lxy]’ just in case it loves some
object (and just in case it does not exemplify the property
denoted by
‘[λy ~∃x(Lxy]’).
There are many systematic connections of this sort among complex
predicates, compound properties, and the things that exemplify them,
and some fairly heavy machinery is required to ensure that things work
smoothly for properties of arbitrarily complexity. (Consider, for
example, [λxyz
∃w(Fxyw & ~(Gy or
∃v(Hzvy)))].)
One way to make all of this work as it should is to add operations
to IRSs that allow us to "build" compound properties up out of
simpler ones. For example, to accommodate conjunctive properties we
introduce an operation, &, that maps each pair of
properties, P and Q (having the same
number of argument places, though this restriction can be dropped at a
slight cost of simplicity) to the conjunctive property
P & Q. To ensure that things work properly we
must also add a clause specifying how the
&-operation interacts with the extension
assignment function. In particular, we require that
ext(P & Q) be the
intersection of ext(P) and
ext(Q).
By adding a handful of additional "property-building" operations
(corresponding to the various connectives, quantifiers, operations on
relations like conversion, and the syntactic operation of
substitution), clauses specifying how each operation interlocks with
the extension assignment, and a recursive definition of the denotations
of predicates, we can ensure that complex predicates denote properties
that behave as they should (Zalta, 1983 contains an elegant account of
one way to do this; Swoyer, 1998 contains a slightly different approach
in which assignments of denotations to complex predicates and
assignments of extensions to the properties they denote are both
treated as homomorphisms). With such a rich stock of properties we can
add a comprehension schema to our logic which tells us that each
condition (open formula) determines a property, i.e., there is at least
one property that an ordered group of things has just in case the open
formula is true of them.3
It is also possible to add complex singular
terms to the language; these are formal counterparts of nominalizations
like being poor but happy. We can then set up the semantics so
that these abstract singular terms denote compound properties.
Some realists hold that it is an empirical question just which
properties there are. On this view, there can be no logical or a priori
existence conditions for properties. It is possible to formulate a very
minimal logic (Swoyer, 1993; 1998) that fits nicely with this
conception. Because it is so minimal, it has a philosophical neutrality
that provides a framework in which various richer theories of
properties (including ones with complex predicates) can be formulated,
classified, and compared.
There are two ways to view the kinds of formal systems described in
this section (whether we call them ‘logics’ or not). We can
view them as attempts to tell the One True Story about an abstract
realm of properties (or the One True Story about the logical structure
underlying a natural language like English or Hindi). On this construal
the various systems are competitors. But it is also possible to view
such formal systems in a more prosaic way, as abstract models that
allow us to represent and reason about various phenomena involving
properties (including various fragments of English). On this picture,
such systems are similar in important respects to formal models in the
sciences. They always involve simplifications and idealizations, and
different models are useful for different purposes. Moreover, if a
simpler model is enough to handle the phenomenon we are interested, it
is overkill to employ more complex models even if they are available.
Various combinations of the features discussed in this section are
possible. At this point several extensions also seem desirable,
including allowing multigrade predicates like ‘had a knock-down,
drag-out fight with each other’ and
multigrade properties.
It is also important to
extend current accounts to deal with vagueness, and it would be
gratifying to see them make contact with recent empirical work on
concepts and categorization.
There has been some discussion of complex or structural properties in
the recent literature, and certainly the metaphor of
relation-building operations
(like
&) may suggest that some properties literally have
parts. This idea can be traced back to Plato's later dialogues, where
he speaks of one Form being part of another (Sophist, 257d).
It has been defended recently by Armstrong (1978, pp. 36-39, pp. 67f)
and Bigelow and Pargetter (1989). This view may have some plausibility
for certain sorts of properties, e.g., conjunctive properties. But the
general view (which these philosophers do not endorse) that properties
literally have logical structures that mirror the syntactic structures
of the complex predicates that denote them is less appealing. In the
case of a negative property, for example, it would require us to think
that the property F is somehow part of the negative property,
being a non-F.
On an alternative view, the appearance that some properties are
literally structured is an artifact of our use of structured terms
(complex, λ-predicates like
‘[λx (Rx &
Sx)]’) to denote them. But our use of structured terms
and structural metaphors doesn't mean that the properties themselves
are genuinely structured or that they literally have parts. There is a
difference between structured specifications, which we do
employ, and specifications of structure, which is another
matter entirely. There are logical relations among properties;
being F and being not F are inconsistent (in the
sense that nothing could exemplify both at once); being F and
G entails being F (in the sense that anything
exemplifying the former property must also exemplify the latter). These
logical relations do structure the realm of properties. This makes a
structured specification a natural device for singling out a member of
this structured realm of entities, since it identifies it by its place
— its logical location — in that domain. But the role of
the syntactic structure of a complex predicate is not to exhibit the
internal structure of a property; it is to disclose that property's
niche in the logical network of properties. We should add the
cautionary note that a picture of compound properties needn't be a
package deal. It is possible to argue that there are no compound
properties, that there are some but not others (e.g., there might be
conjunctive, but no disjunctive, properties), or that there is a
multitude of them. Which view is correct? That is a philosophical
question, and formal work alone cannot answer it.
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American Philosophical Quarterly, 11; 257-275
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Nominalism. Princeton: Princeton University Press.
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Concept Horse is not a Concept’," History of
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out Different Properties, American Philosophical Quarterly,
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Clarendon Press.
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Axiomatic Metaphysics. Dordrecht: D. Reidel.
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Intentionality. Cambridge: MIT Press.
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Objects: A Partial Reconstruction of Frege's Grundgesetze in Object
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Frege, Gottlob: logic, theorem, and foundations for arithmetic |
propositional function |
Russell's paradox |
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universals: the medieval problem of |
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Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy