version history
|
Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy
A |
B |
C |
D |
E |
F |
G |
H |
I |
J |
K |
L |
M |
N |
O |
P |
Q |
R |
S |
T |
U |
V |
W |
X |
Y |
Z
| This document uses XHTML/Unicode to format the display. If you think special symbols are not displaying correctly, see our guide Displaying Special Characters. |
|
last substantive content change
|
Turing Machine
A Turing machine is an abstract representation of a computing device.
It consists of a read/write head that scans a (possibly infinite)
one-dimensional (bi-directional) tape divided into squares, each of
which is inscribed with a 0 or 1. Computation begins with the machine,
in a given "state", scanning a square. It erases what it finds there,
prints a 0 or 1, moves to an adjacent square, and goes into a new
state. This behavior is completely determined by three parameters: (1)
the state the machine is in, (2) the number on the square it is
scanning, and (3) a table of instructions. The table of instructions
specifies, for each state and binary input, what the machine should
write, which direction it should move in, and which state it should go
into. (E.g., "If in State 1 scanning a 0: print 1, move left, and go
into State 3".) The table can list only finitely many states, each of
which becomes implicitly defined by the role it plays in the table of
instructions. These states are often referred to as the "functional
states" of the machine.
A Turing machine, therefore, is more like a computer program
(software) than a computer (hardware). Any given Turing machine can be
realized or implemented on an infinite number of different physical
computing devices. Computer scientists and logicians have shown that if
conventional digital computers are considered in isolation from random
external inputs (such as a bit stream generated by radioactive decay),
then given enough time and tape, Turing machines can compute any
function that any conventional digital computer can compute. (We won't
consider whether Turing machines and modern digital computers remain
equivalent when both are given external inputs, since that would
require us to change the definition of a Turing machine.) Also, a
‘probabilistic automaton’ can be defined as a Turing
machine in which the transition from input and state to output and
state takes place with a certain probability (E.g. "If in State 1
scanning a 0: (a) there is a 60% probability that the machine will
print 1, move left, and go into State 3, and (b) there is a 40%
probability that the machine will print 0, move left, and go into State
2".)
Turing machines were first proposed by Alan Turing, in an attempt to
give a mathematically precise definition of "algorithm" or "mechanical
procedure". Early work by Turing and Alonzo Church spawned the branch
of mathematical logic now known as recursive function theory.
The concept of a Turing machine has played an important role in the
recent philosophy of mind. The suggestion has been made that mental
states just are functional states of a probabilistic automaton, in
which binary inputs and outputs have been replaced by sensory inputs
and motor outputs. This idea underlies the theory of mind known as
"machine functionalism".
- Turing, A., "On Computable Numbers, With an Application to the
Entscheidungsproblem", Proceedings of the London Mathematical
Soceity, Series 2, Volume 42, 1936; reprinted in M. David (ed.),
The Undecidable, Hewlett, NY: Raven Press, 1965
- Boolos, G. and Jeffrey, R., Computability and Logic, 2nd
ed., Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 1980.
- Putnam, H., "The Nature of Mental States", in Mind, Language
and Reality: Philosophical Papers II, Cambridge: Cambridge
University Press, 1975
artificial intelligence |
Church-Turing Thesis |
functionalism |
Turing, Alan
Acknowledgement
The Editors would like to thank Stuart Shieber for pointing out that
Turing machines need not have infinite, two-dimensional tapes, but that
infinite, one-dimensional and bidirectional tapes suffice. We'd also
like to thank Jef Raskin and Joshua Stern for helpful comments about
the equivalence of Turing machines and conventional digital computers.
A |
B |
C |
D |
E |
F |
G |
H |
I |
J |
K |
L |
M |
N |
O |
P |
Q |
R |
S |
T |
U |
V |
W |
X |
Y |
Z
Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy