| This is a file in the archives of the Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy. |
To see that iterated modalities pose no problem for new actualism, recall first that the sentences
(7) The pope (i.e., Karol Wojtyla) could have had a son who could have become a priest. (8) There could be a planet disturbing the orbit of planet Y and it could have a period of Z years.
can be represented as follows:
(9) ◊∃x(Sxp &◊Px) (10) ◊∃x(Dxy & ◊Pxz)
These have straightforward actualist truth conditions requiring no possibilia. For consider (9). The thing x which might have been both the pope's son and possibly a priest is a contingently nonconcrete object that at some other world is the pope's son and at yet another world is a priest.
| Christopher Menzel cmenzel@tamu.edu |