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In defining what beliefs are warranted, given a directed graph representing a cognitive state, Pollock first defines a partial status assignment that assigns the statuses “defeated” or “undefeated” to some of the nodes of the graph.
An assignment σ is a partial status assignment iff:
An assignment σ is a status assignment iff σ is a maximal partial status assignment. A node is defeated outright iff no status assignment assigns “undefeated” to it. If some status assignments assign “defeated” to it, and some assign “undefeated” to it, then it is provisionally defeated. A node is warranted if it is neither defeated outright nor provisionally defeated, that is, if every status assignment assigns “undefeated” to it. Here are some of the consequences of Pollock's definitions:
Robert Koons koons@mail.utexas.edu |