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Aristotle's Metaphysics

First published Sun Oct 8, 2000; substantive revision Mon Jun 11, 2012

The first major work in the history of philosophy to bear the title “Metaphysics” was the treatise by Aristotle that we have come to know by that name. But Aristotle himself did not use that title or even describe his field of study as ‘metaphysics’; the name was evidently coined by the first century C.E. editor who assembled the treatise we know as Aristotle's Metaphysics out of various smaller selections of Aristotle's works. The title ‘metaphysics’—literally, ‘after the Physics’—very likely indicated the place the topics discussed therein were intended to occupy in the philosophical curriculum. They were to be studied after the treatises dealing with nature (ta phusika). In this entry, we discuss the ideas that are developed in Aristotle's treatise.

1. The Subject Matter of Aristotle's Metaphysics

Aristotle himself described his subject matter in a variety of ways: as ‘first philosophy’, or ‘the study of being qua being’, or ‘wisdom’, or ‘theology’. A comment on these descriptions will help to clarify Aristotle's topic.

In Metaphysics A.1, Aristotle says that “all men suppose what is called wisdom (sophia) to deal with the first causes (aitia) and the principles (archai) of things” (981b28), and it is these causes and principles that he proposes to study in this work. It is his customary practice to begin an inquiry by reviewing the opinions previously held by others, and that is what he does here, as Book A continues with a history of the thought of his predecessors about causes and principles.

These causes and principles are clearly the subject matter of what he calls ‘first philosophy’. But this does not mean the branch of philosophy that should be studied first. Rather, it concerns issues that are in some sense the most fundamental or at the highest level of generality. Aristotle distinguished between things that are “better known to us” and things that are “better known in themselves,”[1] and maintained that we should begin our study of a given topic with things better known to us and arrive ultimately at an understanding of things better known in themselves. The principles studied by ‘first philosophy’ may seem very general and abstract, but they are, according to Aristotle, better known in themselves, however remote they may seem from the world of ordinary experience. Still, since they are to be studied only by one who has already studied nature (which is the subject matter of the Physics), they are quite appropriately described as coming “after the Physics.”

Aristotle's description ‘the study of being qua being’ is frequently and easily misunderstood, for it seems to suggest that there is a single (albeit special) subject matter—being qua being—that is under investigation. But Aristotle's description does not involve two things—(1) a study and (2) a subject matter (being qua being)—for he did not think that there is any such subject matter as ‘being qua being’. Rather, his description involves three things: (1) a study, (2) a subject matter (being), and (3) a manner in which the subject matter is studied (qua being).

Aristotle's Greek word that has been Latinized as ‘qua’ means roughly ‘in so far as’ or ‘under the aspect’. A study of x qua y, then, is a study of x that concerns itself solely with the y aspect of x. So Aristotle's study does not concern some recondite subject matter known as ‘being qua being’. Rather it is a study of being, or better, of beings—of things that can be said to be—that studies them in a particular way: as beings, in so far as they are beings.

Of course, first philosophy is not the only field of inquiry to study beings. Natural science and mathematics also study beings, but in different ways, under different aspects. The natural scientist studies them as things that are subject to the laws of nature, as things that move and undergo change. That is, the natural scientist studies things qua movable (i.e., in so far as they are subject to change). The mathematician studies things qua countable and measurable. The metaphysician, on the other hand, studies them in a more general and abstract way—qua beings. So first philosophy studies the causes and principles of beings qua beings. In Γ.2, Aristotle adds that for this reason it studies the causes and principles of substances (ousiai). We will explain this connection in Section 3 below.

In Book E, Aristotle adds another description to the study of the causes and principles of beings qua beings. Whereas natural science studies objects that are material and subject to change, and mathematics studies objects that although not subject to change are nevertheless not separate from (i.e., independent of) matter, there is still room for a science that studies things (if indeed there are any) that are eternal, not subject to change, and independent of matter. Such a science, he says, is theology, and this is the “first” and “highest” science. Aristotle's identification of theology, so conceived, with the study of being qua being has proved challenging to his interpreters. We will deal with this issue in a future update, when Section 14 is completed.

Finally, we may note that in Book B, Aristotle delineates his subject matter in a different way, by listing the problems or perplexities (aporiai) he hopes to deal with. Characteristic of these perplexities, he says, is that they tie our thinking up in knots. They include the following, among others: Are sensible substances the only ones that exist, or are there others besides them? Is it kinds or individuals that are the elements and principles of things? And if it is kinds, which ones: the most generic or the most specific? Is there a cause apart from matter? Is there anything apart from material compounds? Are the principles limited, either in number or in kind? Are the principles of perishable things themselves perishable? Are the principles universal or particular, and do they exist potentially or actually? Are mathematical objects (numbers, lines, figures, points) substances? If they are, are they separate from or do they always belong to sensible things? And (“the hardest and most perplexing of all,” Aristotle says) are unity and being the substance of things, or are they attributes of some other subject? In the remainder of Book B, Aristotle presents arguments on both sides of each of these issues, and in subsequent books he takes up many of them again. But it is not always clear precisely how he resolves them, and it is possible that Aristotle did not think that the Metaphysics contains definitive solutions to all of these perplexities.

2. The Categories

To understand the problems and project of Aristotle's Metaphysics, it is best to begin with one of his earlier works, the Categories. Although placed by long tradition among his logical works (see the discussion in the entry on Aristotle's logic), due to its analysis of the terms that make up the propositions out of which deductive inferences are constructed, the Categories begins with a strikingly general and exhaustive account of the things there are (ta onta)—beings. According to this account, beings can be divided into ten distinct categories. (Although Aristotle never says so, it is tempting to suppose that these categories are mutually exclusive and jointly exhaustive of the things there are.) They include substance, quality, quantity, and relation, among others. Of these categories of beings, it is the first, substance (ousia), to which Aristotle gives a privileged position.

Substances are unique in being independent things; the items in the other categories all depend somehow on substances. That is, qualities are the qualities of substances; quantities are the amounts and sizes that substances come in; relations are the way substances stand to one another. These various non-substances all owe their existence to substances—each of them, as Aristotle puts it, exists only ‘in’ a subject. That is, each non-substance “is in something, not as a part, and cannot exist separately from what it is in” (Cat. 1a25). Indeed, it becomes clear that substances are the subjects that these ontologically dependent non-substances are ‘in’.

Each member of a non-substance category thus stands in this inherence relation (as it is frequently called) to some substance or other—color is always found in bodies, knowledge in the soul. Neither whiteness nor a piece of grammatical knowledge, for example, is capable of existing on its own. Each requires for its existence that there be some substance in which it inheres.

In addition to this fundamental inherence relation across categories, Aristotle also points out another fundamental relation that obtains between items within a single category. He describes this as the relation of “being said of a subject,” and his examples make clear that it is the relation of a more general to a less general thing within a single category. Thus, man is ‘said of’ a particular man, and animal is ‘said of’ man, and therefore, as Aristotle points out, animal is ‘said of’ the particular man also. The ‘said of’ relation, that is to say, is transitive (cf. 1b10). So the genus (e.g., animal) is ‘said of’ the species (e.g., man) and both genus and species are ‘said of’ the particular. The same holds in non-substance categories. In the category of quality, for example, the genus (color) is ‘said of’ the species (white) and both genus and species are ‘said of’ the particular white. There has been considerable scholarly dispute about these particulars in nonsubstance categories. For more detail, see the supplementary document:

Nonsubstantial Particulars

The language of this contrast (‘in’ a subject vs. ‘said of’ a subject) is peculiar to the Categories, but the idea seems to recur in other works as the distinction between accidental vs. essential predication. Similarly, in works other than the Categories, Aristotle uses the label ‘universals’ (ta katholou) for the things that are “said of many;” things that are not universal he calls ‘particulars’ (ta kath’ hekasta). Although he does not use these labels in the Categories, it is not misleading to say that the doctrine of the Categories is that each category contains a hierarchy of universals and particulars, with each universal being ‘said of’ the lower-level universals and particulars that fall beneath it. Each category thus has the structure of an upside-down tree.[2] At the top (or trunk) of the tree are the most generic items in that category[3] (e.g., in the case of the category of substance, the genus plant and the genus animal); branching below them are universals at the next highest level, and branching below these are found lower levels of universals, and so on, down to the lowest level universals (e.g., such infimae species as man and horse); at the lowest level—the leaves of the tree—are found the individual substances, e.g., this man, that horse, etc.

The individuals in the category of substance play a special role in this scheme. Aristotle calls them “primary substances” (prôtai ousiai) for without them, as he says, nothing else would exist. Indeed, Aristotle offers an argument (2a35–2b7) to establish the primary substances as the fundamental entities in this ontology. Everything that is not a primary substance, he points out, stands in one of the two relations (inhering ‘in’, or being ‘said of’) to primary substances. A genus, such as animal, is ‘said of’ the species below it and, since they are ‘said of’ primary substances, so is the genus (recall the transitivity of the ‘said of’ relation). Thus, everything in the category of substance that is not itself a primary substance is, ultimately, ‘said of’ primary substances. And if there were no primary substances, there would be no “secondary” substances (species and genera), either. For these secondary substances are just the ways in which the primary substances are fundamentally classified within the category of substance. As for the members of non-substance categories, they too depend for their existence on primary substances. A universal in a non-substance category, e.g., color, in the category of quality, is ‘in’ body, Aristotle tells us, and therefore in individual bodies. For color could not be ‘in’ body, in general, unless it were ‘in’ at least some particular bodies. Similarly, particulars in non-substance categories (although there is not general agreement among scholars about what such particulars might be) cannot exist on their own. E.g., a determinate shade of color, or a particular and non-shareable bit of that shade, is not capable of existing on its own—if it were not ‘in’ at least some primary substance, it would not exist. So primary substances are the basic entities—the basic “things that there are”—in the world of the Categories.

3. The Role of Substance in the Study of Being Qua Being

The Categories leads us to expect that the study of being in general (being qua being) will crucially involve the study of substance, and when we turn to the Metaphysics we are not disappointed. First, in Metaphysics Γ Aristotle argues in a new way for the ontological priority of substance; and then, in Books Ζ, Η, and Θ, he wrestles with the problem of what it is to be a substance. We will begin with Γ's account of the central place of substance in the study of being qua being.

As we noted above, metaphysics (or, first philosophy) is the science which studies being qua being. In this respect it is unlike the specialized or departmental sciences, which study only part of being (only some of the things that exist) or study beings only in a specialized way (e.g., only in so far as they are changeable, rather than in so far as they are beings).

But ‘being’, as Aristotle tells us in Γ.2, is “said in many ways”. That is, the verb ‘to be’ (einai) has different senses, as do its cognates ‘being’ (on) and ‘entities’ (onta). So the universal science of being qua being appears to founder on an equivocation: how can there be a single science of being when the very term ‘being’ is ambiguous?

Consider an analogy. There are dining tables, and there are tide tables. A dining table is a table in the sense of a smooth flat slab fixed on legs; a tide table is a table in the sense of a systematic arrangement of data in rows and columns. But there is not a single sense of ‘table’ which applies to both the piece of furniture at which I am writing these words and to the small booklet that lies upon it. Hence it would be foolish to expect that there is a single science of tables, in general, that would include among its objects both dining tables and tide tables. Tables, that is to say, do not constitute a single kind with a single definition, so no single science, or field of knowledge, can encompass precisely those things that are correctly called ‘tables’.

If the term ‘being’ were ambiguous in the way that ‘table’ is, Aristotle's science of being qua being would be as impossible as a science of tables qua tables. But, Aristotle argues in Γ.2, ‘being’ is not ambiguous in this way. ‘Being’, he tells us, is ‘said in many ways’ but it is not merely (what he calls) ‘homonymous’, i.e., sheerly ambiguous. Rather, the various senses of ‘being’ have what he calls a ‘pros hen’ ambiguity—they are all related to a single central sense. (The Greek phrase ‘pros hen’ means “in relation to one.”)

Aristotle explains his point by means of some examples that he takes to be analogous to ‘being’. Consider the terms ‘healthy’ and ‘medical’. Neither of these has a single definition that applies uniformly to all cases: not every healthy (or medical) thing is healthy (medical) in the same sense of ‘healthy’ (‘medical’). There is a range of things that can be called ‘healthy’: people, diets, exercise, complexions, etc. Not all of these are healthy in the same sense. Exercise is healthy in the sense of being productive of health; a clear complexion is healthy in the sense of being symptomatic of health; a person is healthy in the sense of having good health.

But notice that these various senses have something in common: a reference to one central thing, health, which is actually possessed by only some of the things that are spoken of as ‘healthy’, namely, healthy organisms, and these are said to be healthy in the primary sense of the term. Other things are considered healthy only in so far as they are appropriately related to things that are healthy in this primary sense.

The situation is the same, Aristotle claims, with the term ‘being’. It, too, has a primary sense as well as related senses in which it applies to other things because they are appropriately related to things that are called ‘beings’ in the primary sense. The beings in the primary sense are substances; the beings in other senses are the qualities, quantities, etc., that belong to substances. An animal, e.g., a horse, is a being, and so is a color, e.g, white, a being. But a horse is a being in the primary sense—it is a substance—whereas the color white (a quality) is a being only because it qualifies some substance. An account of the being of anything that is, therefore, will ultimately have to make some reference to substance. Hence, the science of being qua being will involve an account of the central case of beings—substances.

4. The Fundamental Principles: Axioms

Before embarking on this study of substance, however, Aristotle goes on in Book Γ to argue that first philosophy, the most general of the sciences, must also address the most fundamental principles—the common axioms—that are used in all reasoning. Thus, first philosophy must also concern itself with the principle of non-contradiction (PNC): the principle that “the same attribute cannot at the same time belong and not belong to the same subject and in the same respect” (1005b19). This, Aristotle says, is the most certain of all principles, and it is not just a hypothesis. It cannot, however, be proved, since it is employed, implicitly, in all proofs, no matter what the subject matter. It is a first principle, and hence is not derived from anything more basic.

What, then, can the science of first philosophy say about the PNC? It cannot offer a proof of the PNC, since the PNC is presupposed by any proof one might offer—any purported proof of the PNC would therefore be circular. Aristotle thus does not attempt to prove the PNC; in the subsequent chapters of Γ he argues, instead, that it is impossible to disbelieve the PNC. Those who would claim to deny the PNC cannot, if they have any beliefs at all, believe that it is false. For one who has a belief must, if he is to express this belief to himself or to others, say something—he must make an assertion. He must, as Aristotle says, signify something. But the very act of signifying something is possible only if the PNC is accepted. Without accepting the PNC, one would have no reason to think that his words have any signification at all—they could not mean one thing rather than another. So anyone who makes any assertion has already committed himself to the PNC. Aristotle thus does not argue that the PNC is a necessary truth (that is, he does not try to prove the PNC); rather, he argues that the PNC is indubitable. (For more on the PNC, see the discussion in the entry on Aristotle's logic)

5. What is Substance?

In the seventeen chapters that make up Book Ζ of the Metaphysics, Aristotle takes up the promised study of substance. He begins by reiterating and refining some of what he said in Γ: that ‘being’ is said in many ways, and that the primary sense of ‘being’ is the sense in which substances are beings. Here, however, he explicitly links the secondary senses of ‘being’ to the non-substance categories. The primacy of substance leads Aristotle to say that the age-old question ‘What is being?’ “is just the question ‘What is substance?’” (1028b4).

One might have thought that this question had already been answered in the Categories. There we were given, as examples of primary substances, an individual man or horse, and we learned that a primary substance is “what is neither in a subject nor said of a subject” (2a10). This would seem to provide us with both examples of, and criteria for being, primary substances. But in Metaphysics Ζ, Aristotle does not seem to take either the examples or the criteria for granted.

In Ζ.2 he recounts the various answers that have been given to the question of which things are substances—bodies (including plants, animals, the parts of plants and animals, the elements, the heavenly bodies), things more basic than bodies (surfaces, lines, and points), imperceptible things (such as Platonic Forms and mathematical objects)—and seems to regard them all as viable candidates at this point. He does not seem to doubt that the clearest examples of substances are perceptible ones, but leaves open the question whether there are others as well.

Before answering this question about examples, however, he says that we must first answer the question about criteria: what is it to be a substance (tên ousian prôton ti estin)? The negative criterion (“neither in a subject nor said of a subject”) of the Categories tells us only which things are substances. But even if we know that something is a substance, we must still say what makes it a substance—what the cause is of its being a substance. This is the question to which Aristotle next turns. To answer it is to identify, as Aristotle puts it, the substance of that thing.

6. Substance, Matter, and Subject

Z.3 begins with a list of four possible candidates for being the substance of something: essence, universal, genus, and subject. Presumably, this means that if x is a substance, then the substance of x might be either (i) the essence of x, or (ii) some universal predicated of x, or (iii) a genus that x belongs to, or (iv) a subject of which x is predicated. The first three candidates are taken up in later chapters, and Ζ.3 is devoted to an examination of the fourth candidate: the idea that the substance of something is a subject of which it is predicated.

A subject, Aristotle tells us, is “that of which everything else is predicated, while it is itself not predicated of anything else” (1028b36). This characterization of a subject is reminiscent of the language of the Categories, which tells us that a primary substance is not predicated of anything else, whereas other things are predicated of it. Candidate (iv) thus seems to reiterate the Categories criterion for being a substance. But there are two reasons to be wary of drawing this conclusion. First, whereas the subject criterion of the Categories told us that substances were the ultimate subjects of predication, the subject criterion envisaged here is supposed to tell us what the substance of something is. So what it would tell us is that if x is a substance, then the substance of x—that which makes x a substance—is a subject that x is predicated of. Second, as his next comment makes clear, Aristotle has in mind something other than this Categories idea. For the subject that he here envisages, he says, is either matter or form or the compound of matter and form. These are concepts from Aristotle's Physics, and none of them figured in the ontology of the Categories. To appreciate the issues Aristotle is raising here, we must briefly compare his treatment of the notion of a subject in the Physics with that in the Categories.

In the Categories, Aristotle was concerned with subjects of predication: what are the things we talk about, and ascribe properties to? In the Physics, his concern is with subjects of change: what is it that bears (at different times) contrary predicates and persists through a process of change? But there is an obvious connection between these conceptions of a subject, since a subject of change must have one predicate belonging to it at one time that does not belong to it at another time. Subjects of change, that is, are also subjects of predication. (The converse is not true: numbers are subjects of predication—six is even, seven is prime—but not of change.)

In the Categories, individual substances (a man, a horse) were treated as fundamental subjects of predication. They were also understood, indirectly, as subjects of change. (“A substance, one and the same in number, can receive contraries. An individual man, for example, being one and the same, becomes now pale and now dark, now hot and now cold, now bad and now good” 4a17–20.) These are changes in which substances move, or alter, or grow. What the Categories did not explore, however, are changes in which substances are generated or destroyed. But the theory of change Aristotle develops in the Physics requires some other subject for changes such as these—a subject of which substance is predicated—and it identifies matter as the fundamental subject of change (192a31–32). Change is seen in the Physics as a process in which matter either takes on or loses form.

The concepts of matter and form, as we noted, are absent from the Categories. Individual substances—this man or that horse—apart from their accidental characteristics—the qualities, etc., that inhere in them—are viewed in that work as essentially simple, unanalyzable atoms. Although there is metaphysical structure to the fact that, e.g., this horse is white (a certain quality inheres in a certain substance), the fact that this is a horse is a kind of brute fact, devoid of metaphysical structure. This horse is a primary substance, and horse, the species to which it belongs, is a secondary substance. But there is no predicative complex corresponding to the fact that this is a horse in the way that there is such a complex corresponding to the fact that this horse is white.

But from the point of view of the Physics, substantial individuals are seen as predicative complexes (cf. Matthen 1987b); they are hylomorphic compounds—compounds of matter and form—and the subject criterion looks rather different from the hylomorphic perspective. Metaphysics Ζ.3 examines the subject criterion from this perspective.

Matter, form, and the compound of matter and form may all be considered subjects, Aristotle tells us, (1029a2–4), but which of them is substance? The subject criterion by itself leads to the answer that the substance of x is an entirely indeterminate matter of which x is composed (1029a10). For form is predicated of matter as subject, and one can always analyze a hylomorphic compound into its predicates and the subject of which they are predicated. And when all predicates have been removed (in thought), the subject that remains is nothing at all in its own right—an entity all of whose properties are accidental to it (1029a12–27). The resulting subject is matter from which all form has been expunged. (Traditional scholarship calls this “prime matter,” but Aristotle does not here indicate whether he thinks there actually is such a thing.) So the subject criterion leads to the answer that the substance of x is the formless matter of which it is ultimately composed.

But Aristotle rejects this answer as impossible (1029a28), claiming that substance must be “separate” (chôriston) and “some this” (tode ti, sometimes translated “this something”), and implying that matter fails to meet this requirement. Precisely what the requirement amounts to is a matter of considerable scholarly debate, however. A plausible interpretation runs as follows. Being separate has to do with being able to exist independently (x is separate from y if x is capable of existing independently of y), and being some this means being a determinate individual. So a substance must be a determinate individual that is capable of existing on its own. (One might even hold, although this is controversial, that on Aristotle's account not every “this” is also “separate.” A particular color or shape might be considered a determinate individual that is not capable of existing on its own—it is always the color of shape of some substance or other.) But matter fails to be simultaneously both chôriston and tode ti. The matter of which a substance is composed may exist independently of that substance (think of the wood of which a desk is composed, which existed before the desk was made and may survive the disassembly of the desk), but it is not as such any definite individual—it is just a quantity of a certain kind of matter. Of course, the matter may be construed as constituting a definite individual substance (the wood just is, one might say, the particular desk it composes), but it is in that sense not separate from the form or shape that makes it that substance (the wood cannot be that particular desk unless it is a desk). So although matter is in a sense separate and in a sense some this, it cannot be both separate and some this. It thus does not qualify as the substance of the thing whose matter it is.

7. Substance and Essence

Aristotle turns in Ζ.4 to a consideration of the next candidate for substance: essence. (‘Essence’ is the standard English translation of Aristotle's curious phrase to ti ên einai, literally “the what it was to be” for a thing. This phrase so boggled his Roman translators that they coined the word essentia to render the entire phrase, and it is from this Latin word that ours derives. Aristotle also sometimes uses the shorter phrase to ti esti, literally “the what it is,” for approximately the same idea.) In his logical works, Aristotle links the notion of essence to that of definition (horismos)—“a definition is an account (logos) that signifies an essence” (Topics 102a3)—and he links both of these notions to a certain kind of per se predication (kath’ hauto, literally, “in respect of itself”)—“what belongs to a thing in respect of itself belongs to it in its essence (en tôi ti esti)” for we refer to it “in the account that states the essence” (Posterior Analytics, 73a34–5). He reiterates these ideas in Ζ.4: “there is an essence of just those things whose logos is a definition” (1030a6), “the essence of a thing is what it is said to be in respect of itself” (1029b14). It is important to remember that for Aristotle, one defines things, not words. The definition of tiger does not tell us the meaning of the word ‘tiger’; it tells us what it is to be a tiger, what a tiger is said to be in respect of itself. Thus, the definition of tiger states the essence—the “what it is to be” of a tiger, what is predicated of the tiger per se.

Aristotle's preliminary answer (Z.4) to the question “What is substance?” is that substance is essence, but there are important qualifications. For, as he points out, “definition (horismos), like ‘what it is’ (ti esti), is said in many ways” (1030a19). That is, items in all the categories are definable, so items in all the categories have essences—just as there is an essence of man, there is also an essence of white and an essence of musical. But, because of the pros hen equivocity of ‘is’, such essences are secondary—“definition and essence are primarily (protôs) and without qualification (haplôs) of substances” (1030b4–6). Thus, Ζ.4 tells us, it is only these primary essences that are substances. Aristotle does not here work out the details of this “hierarchy of essences” (Loux, 1991), but it is possible to reconstruct a theory of such a hierarchy on the basis of subsequent developments in Book Ζ.

In Ζ.6, Aristotle goes on to argue that if something is “primary” and “spoken of in respect of itself (kath’ hauto legomenon)” it is one and the same as its essence. The precise meaning of this claim, as well as the nature and validity of the arguments offered in support of it, are matters of scholarly controversy. But it does seem safe to say that Aristotle thinks that an “accidental unity” such as a pale man is not a kath’ hauto legomenon (since pallor is an accidental characteristic of a man) and so is not the same as its essence. Pale man, that is to say, does not specify the “what it is” of any primary being, and so cannot be an essence of the primary kind. As Ζ.4 has already told us, “only species of a genus have an essence” (1030a11–12) in the primary sense. Man is a species, and so there is an essence of man; but pale man is not a species and so, even if there is such a thing as the essence of pale man, it is not, at any rate, a primary essence.

At this point there appears to be a close connection between the essence of a substance and its species (eidos), and this might tempt one to suppose that Aristotle is identifying the substance of a thing (since the substance of a thing is its essence) with its species. (A consequence of this idea would be that Aristotle is radically altering his conception of the importance of the species, which in the Categories he called a secondary substance, that is, a substance only in a secondary sense.) But such an identification would be a mistake, for two reasons. First, Aristotle's point at 1030a11 is not that a species is an essence, but that an essence of the primary kind corresponds to a species (e.g., man) and not to some more narrowly delineated kind (e.g., pale man). Second, the word ‘eidos’, which meant ‘species’ in the logical works, has acquired a new meaning in a hylomorphic context, where it means ‘form’ (contrasted with ‘matter’) rather than ‘species’ (contrasted with ‘genus’). In the conceptual framework of Metaphysics Ζ, a universal such as man or horse—which was called a species and a secondary substance in the Categories—is construed as “not a substance, but a compound of a certain formula and a certain matter, taken universally” (Z.10, 1035b29–30). The eidos that is primary substance in Book Ζ is not the species that an individual substance belongs to but the form that is predicated of the matter of which it is composed.[4]

8. Substances as Hylomorphic Compounds

The role of form in this hylomorphic context is the topic of Ζ.7–9. (Although these chapters were almost certainly not originally included in Book Ζ—there is no reference to them, for example, in the summary of Ζ given in Η.1, which skips directly from Ζ.6 to Ζ.10—they provide a link between substance and form and thus fill what would otherwise be a gap in the argument.) Since individual substances are seen as hylomorphic compounds, the role of matter and form in their generation must be accounted for. Whether we are thinking of natural objects, such as plants and animals, or artifacts, such as houses, the requirements for generation are the same. We do not produce the matter (to suppose that we do leads to an infinite regress) nor do we produce the form (what could we make it out of?); rather, we put the form into the matter, and produce the compound (Z.8, 1033a30–b9). Both the matter and the form must pre-exist (Z.9, 1034b12). But the source of motion in both cases—what Aristotle calls the “moving cause” of the coming to be—is the form.

In artistic production, the form is found in the soul of the artisan, for “the art of building is the form of the house” (1034a24) and “the form is in the soul” (1032b23) of the artisan. For example, the builder has in mind the plan or design for a house and he knows how to build; he then “enmatters” that plan or design by putting it into the materials out of which he builds the house. In natural production, the form is found in the parent, where “the begetter is the same in kind as the begotten, not one in number but one in form—for man begets man” (1033b30–2). But in either case, the form pre-exists and is not produced (1033b18).

As for what is produced in such hylomorphic productions, it is correctly described by the name of its form, not by that of its matter. What is produced is a house or a man, not bricks or flesh. Of course, what is made of gold may still be described in terms of its material components, but we should call it not “gold” but “golden” (1033a7). For if gold is the matter out of which a statue is made, there was gold present at the start, and so it was not gold that came into being. It was a statue that came into being, and although the statue is golden—i.e., made of gold—it cannot be identified with the gold of which it was made.

The essence of such a hylomorphic compound is evidently its form, not its matter. As Aristotle says “by form I mean the essence of each thing, and its primary substance” (1032b1), and “when I speak of substance without matter I mean the essence” (1032b14). It is the form of a substance that makes it the kind of thing that it is, and hence it is form that satisfies the condition initially required for being the substance of something. The substance of a thing is its form.

9. Substance and Definition

In Ζ.10 and 11, Aristotle returns to the consideration of essence and definition left off in Ζ.6, but now within the hylomorphic context developed in Ζ.7–9. The main question these chapters consider is whether the definition of x ever includes a reference to the matter of x. If some definitions include a reference to matter, then the link between essence and form would seem to be weakened.

Aristotle begins Ζ.10 by endorsing the following principle about definitions and their parts: “a definition is an account, and every account has parts, and part of the account stands to part of the thing in just the same way that the whole account stands to the whole thing” (1034b20–22). That is, if y is a part of a definable thing x, then the definition of x will include as a part something z that corresponds to y. Indeed, z must stand to y in the same relation that the definition of x stands in to x; that is, z is the definition of y. So, according to this principle, the definition of a thing will include the definitions of its parts.

In a way, this consequence of the principle seems very plausible, given Aristotle's idea that it is universals that are definable (Z.11, 1036a29). Consider as a definiendum a universal, such as man, and its definiens, rational animal. The parts of this definiens are the universals rational and animal. If these parts are, in turn, definable, then each should be replaced, in the definition of man, with its own definition, and so on. In this way the complete and adequate definition of a universal such as man will contain no parts that are further definable. All proper, or completely analyzed, definitions are ultimately composed of simple terms that are not further definable.

But the implication of this idea for the definitions of hylomorphic compounds is obvious: since matter appears to be a part of such a compound, the definition of the compound will include, as a part, the definitions of its material components. And this consequence seems implausible to Aristotle. A circle, for example, seems to be composed of two semicircles (for it obviously may be divided into two semicircles), but the definition of circle cannot be composed of the definitions of its two semicircular parts. For, as Aristotle points out (1035b9), semicircle is defined in terms of circle, and not the other way around. His point is well taken, for if circles were defined in terms of semicircles, then presumably semicircles would be defined in terms of the quarter-circles of which they are composed, and so on, ad infinitum. The resulting infinite regress would make it impossible to define circle at all, for one would never reach the ultimate “simple” parts of which such a definition would be composed.

Aristotle flirts with the idea of distinguishing between different senses in which one thing can be a part of another (1034b33), but instead proposes a different solution: to specify carefully the whole of which the matter is allegedly a part. “The bronze is part of the compound statue, but not of the statue spoken of as form” (1035a6). Similarly, “the line when divided passes away into its halves, and the man into bones and muscle and flesh, but it does not follow that they are composed of these as parts of their essence” (1035a17–20). Rather, “it is not the substance but the compound that is divided into the body and its parts as into matter” (1035b21–2).

In restating his point “yet more clearly” (1035b4), Aristotle notes parenthetically another important aspect of his theory of substance. He reiterates the priority of form, and its parts, to the matter into which a compound is divided, and notes that “the soul of animals (for this is the substance of living things) is their substance” (1035b15). The idea recurs in Ζ.11, where he announces that “it is clear that the soul is the primary substance and the body is matter” (1037a5). It is further developed, in the Metaphysics, in Ζ.17, as we will see below, and especially in De Anima. For more detail on this topic, see Section 3 of the entry on Aristotle's psychology.

Returning now to the problem raised by the apparent need to refer to matter in the definition of a substance, we may note that the solution Aristotle offered in Ζ.10 is only partially successful. His point seems to be that whereas bronze may be a part of a particular statue, neither that particular batch of bronze nor even bronze in general enters into the essence of statue, since being made of bronze is no part of what it is to be a statue. But that is only because statues, although they must be made of some kind of matter, do not require any particular kind of matter. But what about kinds of substances that do require particular kinds of matter? Aristotle's distinction between form and compound cannot be used in such cases to isolate essence from matter. Thus there may after all be reasons for thinking that reference to matter will have to intrude into at least some definitions.

In Ζ.11, Aristotle addresses just such a case (although the passage is difficult and there is disagreement over its interpretation). “The form of man is always found in flesh and bones and parts of this kind,” Aristotle writes (1036b4). The point is not just that each particular man must be made of matter, but that each one must be made of matter of a particular kind—flesh and bones, etc. “Some things,” he continues, “surely are a particular form in a particular matter” (1036b23), so that it is not possible to define them without reference to their material parts (1036b28). Nevertheless, Aristotle ends Ζ.11 as if he has defended the claim that definition is of the form alone. Perhaps his point is that whenever it is essential to a substance that it be made of a certain kind of matter (e.g., that man be made of flesh and bones, or that “a saw cannot be made of wool or wood,” Η.4, 1044a28) this is in some sense a formal or structural requirement. A kind of matter, after all, can itself be analyzed hylomorphically—bronze, for example, is a mixture of copper and tin according to a certain ratio or formula (logos), which is in turn predicated of some more generic underlying subject. The reference to matter in a definition will thus always be to a certain kind of matter, and hence to a predicate, rather than a subject. At any rate, if by ‘matter’ one has in mind the ultimate subject alluded to in Ζ.3 (so-called ‘prime matter’), there will be no reference to it in any definition, “for this is indefinite” (1037a27).

Ζ.12 introduces a new problem about definitions—the so-called “unity of definition.” The problem is this: definitions are complex (a definiens is always some combination of terms), so what accounts for the definiendum being one thing, rather than many (1037b10)? Man, for example, is defined as rational animal; “why is this one and not many—rational and animal?” (1037b13–14). Presumably, Aristotle has in mind his discussion in Ζ.4 of such “accidental unities” as a pale man. The difference cannot be that our language contains a single word (‘man’) for a rational animal, but no single word for a pale man, for Aristotle has already conceded (1029b28) that we might very well have had a single term (he suggests himation, literally ‘cloak’) for a pale man, but that would still not make the formula ‘pale man’ a definition nor pale man an essence (1030a2).

Aristotle proposes a solution that applies to definitions reached by the “method of division.” According to this method (see Aristotle's logic), one begins with the broadest genus containing the species to be defined, and divides the genus into two sub-genera by means of some differentia. One then locates the definiendum in one of the sub-genera, and proceeds to divide this by another differentia, and so on, until one arrives at the definiendum species. This is a classic definition by genus and differentia. Aristotle's proposal is that “the division should be by the differentia of the differentia” (1038a9). For example, if one uses the differentia footed to divide the genus animal, one then uses a differentia such as cloven-footed for the next division. If one divides in this way, Aristotle claims, “clearly the last (or completing, teleutaia) differentia will be the substance of the thing and its definition” (1038a19). For each “differentia of a differentia” entails its predecessor (being cloven-footed entails being footed), and so the long chain of differentiae can be replaced simply by the last differentia. As Aristotle points out, “saying footed two-footed animal … is saying the same thing more than once” (1038a22–24).

This proposal shows how a long string of differentiae in a definition can be reduced to one, but it does not solve the problem of the unity of definition. For we are still faced with the apparent fact that genus + differentia constitutes a plurality even if the differentia is the last, or “completing,” one. It is not surprising, then, that Aristotle returns to the problem of unity later (H.6) and offers a different solution.

10. Substances and Universals

At this point, we seem to have a clear idea about the nature of substantial form as Aristotle conceives of it. A substantial form is the essence of a substance, and it corresponds to a species. Since it is an essence, a substantial form is what is denoted by the definiens of a definition. Since only universals are definable, substantial forms are universals. That substantial forms are universals is confirmed by Aristotle's comment, at the end of Ζ.8, that “Socrates and Callias are different because of their matter … but they are the same in form” (1034a6–8). For them to be the same in form is for them to have the same form, i.e., for one and the same substantial form to be predicated of two different clumps of matter. And being “predicated of many” is what makes something a universal (De Interpretatione 17a37).

But Ζ.13 throws our entire understanding into disarray. Aristotle begins by returning to the candidates for the title of ousia introduced in Ζ.3, and points out that having now discussed the claims of the subject and the essence, it is time to consider the third candidate, the universal. But the remainder of the chapter consists of a barrage of arguments to the conclusion that universals are not substances.

Z.13 therefore produces a fundamental tension in Aristotle's metaphysics that has fragmented his interpreters. Some maintain that Aristotle's theory is ultimately inconsistent, on the grounds that it is committed to all three of the following propositions:

(i) Substance is form.
(ii) Form is universal.
(iii) No universal is a substance.

Others have provided interpretations according to which Aristotle does not maintain all of (i)–(iii), and there is a considerable variety of such interpretations, too many to be canvassed here. But there are two main, and opposed, lines of interpretation. According to one, Aristotle's substantial forms are not universals after all, but each belongs exclusively to the particular whose form it is, and there are therefore as many substantial forms of a given kind as there are particulars of that kind. According to the other, Aristotle's arguments in Ζ.13 are not intended to show that no universal is a substance, tout court, but some weaker thesis that is compatible with there being only one substantial form for all of the particulars belonging to the same species. Proponents of particular forms (or essences) include Sellars 1957, Harter 1975, Hartman 1977, Irwin 1988, Witt 1989b. Opponents include Woods 1967, Owen 1978, Code 1986, Loux 1991, Lewis 1991.

It would be foolish to attempt to resolve this issue within the confines of the present entry, as it is perhaps the largest, and most disputed, single interpretative issue concerning Aristotle's Metaphysics. I will, instead, mention some of the main considerations brought up on each side of this dispute, and give my reasons for thinking that substantial forms are universals.

The idea that substantial forms are particulars is supported by Aristotle's claims that a substance is “separate and some this” (chôriston kai tode ti, Ζ.3), that there are no universals apart from their particulars (Z.13), and that universals are not substances (Z.13). On the other side, the idea that substantial forms are universals is supported by Aristotle's claims that substances are, par excellence, the definable entities (Z.4), that definition is of the universal (Z.11), and that it is impossible to define particulars (Z.15).

In my opinion, the indefinability of particulars makes it impossible for substantial forms to be particulars. If there were a substantial form that is unique to some sensible particular, say Callias, then the definition corresponding to that form, or essence, would apply uniquely to Callias—it would define him, which is precisely what Aristotle says cannot be done. The question, then, is whether the evidence against substantial forms being universals can be countered. This is less clear, but the following considerations are relevant. (1) Aristotle's claim that a substantial form is an individual (tode ti) does not exclude its being a universal (katholou). Universals are contrasted with particulars (kath’ hekasta), not individuals (although Aristotle does sometimes ignore the distinction between tode ti and kath’ hekaston). What makes something a tode ti is its being a fully determinate thing, not further differentiable; what makes something a kath’ hekaston is its being a particular thing, unrepeatable, and not predicated of anything else. There is thus the possibility of a universal tode ti—a fully determinate universal not further divisible into lower-level universals, but predicated of numerous particulars. (2) The claim that there are no universals apart from particulars needs to be understood in context. When Aristotle asserts (1038b33) that “there is no animal apart from the particulars (ta tina)” he is just as likely to be referring to the particular kinds of animals as he is to particular specimens. If so, his point may be that a generic kind, such as animal, is ontologically dependent on its species, and hence on the substantial forms that are the essences of those species. (3) The arguments of Ζ.13 against the substantiality of universals are presented as part of a give-and-take investigation of the perplexities involved in the notion of substantial form. It is not clear, therefore, whether the blanket claim “No universal is a substance” is intended to be accepted without qualification. Indeed, a closer examination of the arguments may show that qualifications are required if the arguments are to be cogent. For example, the argument at 1038b11–15 is based on the premise that the substance of x is peculiar (idion) to x. It then draws the conclusion that a universal cannot be the substance of all of its instances (for it could not be idion to all of them), and concludes that it must be the substance “of none.” But note that this conclusion does not say that no universal can be a substance, but only that no universal can be the substance of any of its instances (cf. Code 1978). Aristotle's point may be that since form is predicated of matter, a substantial form is predicated of various clumps of matter. But it is not the substance of those clumps of matter, for it is predicated accidentally of them. The thing with which it is uniquely correlated, and of which it is the substance, is not one of its instances, but is the substantial form itself. This conclusion should not be surprising in light of Aristotle's claim in Ζ.6 that “each substance is one and the same as its essence.” A universal substantial form just is that essence.

11. Substance as Cause of Being

In Ζ.17 Aristotle proposes a new point of departure in his effort to say what sort of a thing substance is. The new idea is that a substance is a “principle and a cause” (archê kai aitia, 1041a9) of being. Before looking at the details of his account, we will need to make a brief detour into Aristotle's theory of causes. The relevant texts are Physics II.3, Posterior Analytics II.11, and Metaphysics A.3 and Δ.2. See also the entry on Aristotle's natural philosophy and Section 2 of the entry on Aristotle's psychology.

The word aitia (“cause” or, perhaps better, “explanation”), Aristotle tells us, is “said in many ways.” In one sense, a cause is “that out of which a thing comes to be, and which persists; e.g., bronze, silver, and the genus of these are causes of a statue or a bowl” (Physics 194b24). A cause in this sense has been traditionally called a material cause, although Aristotle himself did not use this label. In a second sense, a cause is “the form … the account of the essence” (194b27), traditionally called the formal cause. A third sense, traditionally called the efficient cause, is “the primary source of change or rest” (194b30). In this sense, Aristotle says, an adviser is the cause of an action, a father is the cause of his child, and in general the producer is the cause of the product. Fourth is what is traditionally called the final cause, which Aristotle characterizes as “the end (telos), that for which a thing is done” (194b33). In this sense, he says, health is the cause of walking, since we might explain a person's walking by saying that he walks in order to be healthy—health is what the walking is for. Note that, as in this case, “things may be causes of one another—hard work of fitness, and fitness of hard work—although not in the same sense: fitness is what hard work is for, whereas hard work is principle of motion” (195a10). So hard work is the efficient cause of fitness, since one becomes fit by means of hard work, while fitness is the final cause of hard work, since one works hard in order to become fit.

Although Aristotle is careful to distinguish four different kinds of cause (or four different senses of ‘cause’), it is important to note that he claims that one and the same thing can be a cause in more than one sense. As he puts it, “form, mover, and telos often coincide” (198a25). And in De Anima he is perfectly explicit that the soul, which is the form or essence of a living thing, “is a cause in three of the ways we have distinguished” (415b10)—efficient, formal, and final.

Let us return to Aristotle's discussion in Ζ.17. The job of a cause or principle of being, he notes, is to explain why one thing belongs to another (1041a11); that is, it is to explain some predicational fact. What needs to be explained, for example, is why this is a man, or that is a house. But what kind of a question is this? The only thing that can be a man is a man; the only thing that can be a house is a house. So we would appear to be asking why a man is a man, or why a house is a house, and these seem to be foolish questions that all have the same answer: because each thing is itself (1041a17–20). The questions must therefore be rephrased by taking advantage of the possibility of a hylomorphic analysis. We must ask, e.g., “Why are these things, i.e., bricks and stones, a house?” (1041a26). The answer Aristotle proposes is that the cause of being of a substance (e.g., of a house) is the form or essence that is predicated of the matter (e.g., of the bricks and stones) that constitute that substance. The essence is not always just a formal cause; in some cases, Aristotle says, it is also a final cause (he gives the examples of a house and a bed), and in some cases an efficient cause (1041a29–30). But in any case “what we seek is the cause, i.e., the form, by reason of which the matter is some definite thing; and this is the substance of the thing” (1041b6–9) and “the primary cause of its being” (1041b27).

Notice that the explanandum in these cases (“why is this a man?” or “why is that a house?”) involves a species predication (“Callias is a man,” “Fallingwater is a house”). But the answer Aristotle proposes invokes a hylomorphic analysis of these questions, in which form is predicated of matter. So Callias is a man because the form or essence of man is present in the flesh and bones that constitute the body of Callias; Fallingwater is a house because the form of house is present in the materials of which Fallingwater is made. In general, a species predication is explained in terms of an underlying form predication, whose subject is not the particular compound but its matter. Form predications are thus more basic than their corresponding species predications. A substantial form, as a primary definable, is its own substance, for it is essentially predicated of itself alone. But the substantial form of a material compound, because it is predicated (accidentally) of the matter of the compound, is the cause of the compound's being the kind of thing that it is. The form is therefore, in a derivative way, the substance of the compound, as well.

12. Actuality and Potentiality

In Metaphysics Ζ, Aristotle introduces the distinction between matter and form synchronically, applying it to an individual substance at a particular time. The matter of a substance is the stuff it is composed of; the form is the way that stuff is put together so that the whole it constitutes can perform its characteristic functions. But soon he begins to apply the distinction diachronically, across time. This connects the matter/form distinction to another key Aristotelian distinction, that between potentiality (dunamis) and actuality (entelecheia or energeia). This distinction is the main topic of Book Θ.

Aristotle distinguishes between two different senses of the term dunamis. In the strictest sense, a dunamis is the power that a thing has to produce a change. A thing has a dunamis in this sense when it has within it a “source of change in something else (or in itself qua other)” (Θ.1, 1046a12; cf. Δ.12). The exercise of such a power is a kinêsis—a movement or process. So, for example, the housebuilder's craft is a power whose exercise is the process of housebuilding. But there is a second sense of dunamis—and it is the one in which Aristotle is mainly interested—that might be better translated as ‘potentiality’. For, as Aristotle tells us, in this sense dunamis is related not to movement (kinêsis) but to actuality (energeia)(Θ.6, 1048a25). A dunamis in this sense is not a thing's power to produce a change but rather its capacity to be in a different and more completed state. Aristotle thinks that potentiality so understood is indefinable (1048a37), claiming that the general idea can be grasped from a consideration of cases. Actuality is to potentiality, Aristotle tells us, as “someone waking is to someone sleeping, as someone seeing is to a sighted person with his eyes closed, as that which has been shaped out of some matter is to the matter from which it has been shaped” (1048b1–3).

This last illustration is particularly illuminating. Consider, for example, a piece of wood, which can be carved or shaped into a table or into a bowl. In Aristotle's terminology, the wood has (at least) two different potentialities, since it is potentially a table and also potentially a bowl. The matter (in this case, wood) is linked with potentialty; the substance (in this case, the table or the bowl) is linked with actuality. The as yet uncarved wood is only potentially a table, and so it might seem that once it is carved the wood is actually a table. Perhaps this is what Aristotle means, but it is possible that he does not wish to consider the wood to be a table. His idea might be that not only can a piece of raw wood in the carpenter's workshop be considered a potential table (since it can be transformed into one), but the wood composing the completed table is also, in a sense, a potential table. The idea here is that it is not the wood qua wood that is actually a table, but the wood qua table. Considered as matter, it remains only potentially the thing that it is the matter of. (A contemporary philosopher might make this point by refusing to identify the wood with the table, saying instead that the wood only constitutes the table and is not identical to the table it constitutes.)

Since Aristotle gives form priority over matter, we would expect him similarly to give actuality priority over potentiality. And that is exactly what we find (Θ.8, 1049b4–5). Aristotle distinguishes between priority in logos (account or definition), in time, and in substance. (1) Actuality is prior in logos since we must cite the actuality when we give an account of its corresponding potentiality. Thus, ‘visible’ means ‘capable of being seen’; ‘buildable’ means ‘capable of being built’(1049b14–16). (2) As regards temporal priority, by contrast, potentiality may well seem to be prior to actuality, since the wood precedes the table that is built from it, and the acorn precedes the oak that it grows into. Nevertheless, Aristotle finds that even temporally there is a sense in which actuality is prior to potentiality: “the actual which is identical in species though not in number with a potentially existing thing is prior to it” (1049b18–19). A particular acorn is, of course, temporally prior to the particular oak tree that it grows into, but it is preceded in time by the actual oak tree that produced it, with which it is identical in species. The seed (potential substance) must have been preceded by an adult (actual substance). So in this sense actuality is prior even in time.

(3) Aristotle argues for the priority in substance of actuality over potentiality in two ways. (a) The first argument makes use of his notion of final causality. Things that come to be move toward an end (telos)—the boy becomes a man, the acorn becomes an oak—and “the actuality is the end, and it is for the sake of this that the potentiality is acquired ... animals do not see in order that they may have sight, but they have sight that they may see ... matter exists in a potential state, just because it may come to its form; and when it exists actually, then it is in its form” (1050a9–17). Form or actuality is the end toward which natural processes are directed. Actuality is therefore a cause in more than one sense of a thing's realizing its potential. As we noted in Section 11, one and the same thing may be the final, formal, and efficient cause of another. Suppose an acorn realizes its potential to become an oak tree. The efficient cause here is the actual oak tree that produced the acorn; the formal cause is the logos defining that actuality; the final cause is the telos toward which the acorn develops—an actual (mature) oak tree.

(b) Aristotle also offers (1050b6–1051a2) an “even stricter” argument for his claim that actuality is prior in substance to potentiality. A potentiality is for either of a pair of opposites; so anything that is capable of being is also capable of not being. What is capable of not being might possibly not be, and what might possibly not be is perishable. Hence anything with the mere potentiality to be is perishable. What is eternal is imperishable, and so nothing that is eternal can exist only potentially—what is eternal must be fully actual. But the eternal is prior in substance to the perishable. For the eternal can exist without the perishable, but not conversely, and that is what priority in substance amounts to (cf. Δ.11, 1019a2). So what is actual is prior in substance to what is potential.

13. Unity Reconsidered

In Η.6, Aristotle returns to the problem of the unity of definition (discussed above in Section 9) and offers a new solution based on the concepts of potentiality and actuality. He begins by pointing out (recalling the language of Ζ.17) that the things whose unity he is trying to explain are those “which have several parts and in which the totality is not, as it were, a mere heap, but the whole is something besides the parts” (1045a8–10). His task is to explain the unity of such complexes.

The problem is insoluble, he says, unless one realizes that “one element is matter and another is form, and one is potentially and the other is actually.” Once one realizes this, “the question will no longer be thought a difficulty” (1045a20–25). He offers the following example (1045a26–35). Suppose round bronze were the definition of ‘cloak’. If someone were to ask “what makes a cloak one thing, a unity?” the answer would be obvious. For bronze is the matter, and roundness is the form. The bronze is potentially round, and round is what the bronze actually is when it has received this form. The cause of the unity of the cloak (in this sense of ‘cloak’) is just the cause of bronze being made round. Since the cloak is something that was produced, or brought into being, there is no cause of its unity other than the agent who put the form into the matter. Bronze (the matter) is a potential sphere, and the cloak is an actual sphere. But round bronze is equally the essence of both the actual sphere and the potential one. The bronze and the roundness are not two separate things. The bronze is potentially a sphere, and when it is made round it constitutes an actual one—a single sphere of bronze.

It is easy to see how this hylomorphic analysis explains the unity of a substantial material particular, since neither the matter nor the form of such a particular is by itself a single material individual, and it is only when they are taken together that they constitute such an individual. But the problem Aristotle is trying to solve concerns “the unity of the thing whose account we call a definition” (Z.12, 1037b11). And since proper definables are universals, it remains to be seen how the proposed solution applies to them. After all, universals are not material objects, and so it is not clear how they can be viewed as hylomorphic compounds. But Aristotle has at his disposal a concept that can fill this bill perfectly, viz., the concept of intelligible matter (hulê noêtê). (The main purpose of intelligible matter is to provide something quasi-material for pure geometrical objects that are not realized in bronze or stone, for example, to be made of.) So I surmise that it is for this reason that Aristotle goes on (1045a33) to introduce matter into the current context. If this is so, we may conclude that the material component in the definition of a species is intelligible matter. Elsewhere, he explicitly describes genus as matter: “the genus is the matter of that of which it is called the genus” (I.8, 1058a23). So a species too, although it is not itself a material object, can be considered a hylomorphic compound. Its matter is its genus, which is only potentially the species defined; its differentia is the form that actualizes the matter. The genus does not actually exist independently of its species any more than bronze exists apart from all form. The genus animal, for example, is just that which is potentially some specific kind of animal or other. Aristotle concludes (1045b17–21) that “the proximate matter and the form are one and the same thing, the one potentially, and the other actually ... the potential and the actual are somehow one.”

This solution, of course, applies only to hylomorphic compounds. But that is all it needs to do, according to Aristotle. For he ends the chapter by claiming that the problem of unity does not arise for other kinds of compounds. “All things which have no matter are without qualification essentially unities” (1045b23).

14. Glossary of Aristotelian Terminology

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Acknowledgments

I am grateful to István Bodnar for his help in clarifying and improving my presentation of Frede's reading, and for stressing the underlying similarity between the Frede and Owen readings.