Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy
This is a file in the archives of the Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy.

Saint Augustine

First published Fri Mar 24, 2000; substantive revision Fri Nov 12, 2010

Aurelius Augustinus [more commonly “St. Augustine of Hippo,” often simply “Augustine”] (354–430 C.E.): rhetor, Christian Neoplatonist, North African Bishop, Doctor of the Roman Catholic Church. One of the decisive developments in the western philosophical tradition was the eventually widespread merging of the Greek philosophical tradition and the Judeo-Christian religious and scriptural traditions. Augustine is one of the main figures through and by whom this merging was accomplished. He is, as well, one of the towering figures of medieval philosophy whose authority and thought came to exert a pervasive and enduring influence well into the modern period (e.g. Descartes and especially Malebranche), and even up to the present day, especially among those sympathetic to the religious tradition which he helped to shape (e.g. Plantinga 1992; Adams 1999). But even for those who do not share this sympathy, there is much in Augustine's thought that is worthy of serious philosophical attention. Augustine is not only one of the major sources whereby classical philosophy in general and Neoplatonism in particular enter into the mainstream of early and subsequent medieval philosophy, but there are significant contributions of his own that emerge from his modification of that Greco-Roman inheritance, e.g., his subtle accounts of belief and authority, his account of knowledge and illumination, his emphasis upon the importance and centrality of the will, and his focus upon a new way of conceptualizing the phenomena of human history, just to cite a few of the more conspicuous examples.

1. Context

Only four of his seventy-five years were spent outside Northern Africa, and fifty-seven of the remaining seventy-one were in such relatively out of the way places as Thagaste and Hippo Regius, both belonging to Roman provinces, neither notable for either cultural or commercial prominence. However, the few years Augustine spent away from Northern Africa exerted an incalculable influence upon his thought, and his geographical distance from the major intellectual and political capitals of the Later Roman Empire should not obscure the tremendous influence he came to exert even in his own lifetime. Here, as elsewhere, one is confronted by a figure both strikingly liminal and, at times, intriguingly ambivalent. He was, as already noted, a long time resident and, eventually, Bishop in Northern Africa whose thought was transformed and redirected during the four brief years he spent in Rome and Milan, far away from the provincial context where he was born and died and spent almost all of the years in between; he was a man who tells us that he never thought of himself as not being in some sense a Christian [Confessions III.iv.8], yet he composed a spiritual autobiography containing one of the most celebrated conversion accounts in all of Christian literature; he was a classically trained rhetorician who used his skills to eloquently proclaim at length the superiority of Christian culture over Greco-Roman culture, and he also served as one of the central figures by whom the latter was transformed and transmitted to the former. Perhaps most striking of all, Augustine bequeathed to the Latin West a voluminous body of work that contains at its chronological extremes two quite dissimilar portraits of the human condition. In the beginning, there is a largely Hellenistic portrait, one that is notable for the optimism that a sufficiently rational and disciplined life can safely escape the ever-threatening circumstantial adversity that seems to surround us. Nearer the end, however, there emerges a considerably grimmer portrait, one that emphasizes the impotence of the unaided human will, and the later Augustine presents a moral landscape populated largely by the massa damnata [De Civitate Dei XXI.12], the overwhelming majority who are justly predestined to eternal punishment by an omnipotent God, intermingled with a small minority whom God, with unmerited mercy, has predestined to be saved. The sheer quantity of the writing that unites these two extremes, much of which survives, is truly staggering. There are well over 100 titles [listed at Fitzgerald 1999, pp. xxxv–il], many of which are themselves voluminous and composed over lengthy periods of time, not to mention over 200 letters [listed at Fitzgerald 1999, pp. 299–305] and close to 400 sermons [listed at Fitzgerald 1999, pp. 774–789]. It is arguably impossible to construct any moderate sized and manageable list of his major philosophical works that would not occasion some controversy in terms of what is omitted, but surely any list would have to include Contra Academicos [Against the Academicians, 386–387 C.E.], De Libero Arbitrio [On Free Choice of the Will, Book I, 387/9 C.E.; Books II & III, circa 391–395 C.E.], De Magistro [On The Teacher, 389 C.E.], Confessiones [Confessions, 397–401 C.E.], De Trinitate [On The Trinity, 399–422 C.E.], De Genesi ad Litteram [On The Literal Meaning of Genesis, 401–415 C.E.], De Civitate Dei [On The City of God, 413–427C.E.], and Retractationes [Reconsiderations, 426–427 C.E.].

Born in 354 C.E. in Thagaste (in what is now Algeria), he was educated in Thagaste, Madauros, and Carthage, and sometime around 370 he began a thirteen-year, monogamous relationship with the mother of his son, Adeodatus (born 372). He subsequently taught rhetoric in Thagaste and Carthage, and in 383 he made the risk-laden journey from Northern Africa to Rome, seeking the better sort of students that was rumored to be there. Disappointed by the moral quality of those students (academically superior to his previous students, they nonetheless had an annoying tendency to disappear without paying their fees), he successfully applied for a professorship of rhetoric in Milan. Augustine's professional ambitions pointed in the direction of an arranged marriage, and this in turn entailed a separation from his long-time companion and mother of his son. After this separation, however, Augustine abruptly resigned his professorship in 386 claiming ill health, renounced his professional ambitions, and was baptized by Bishop Ambrose of Milan on Easter Sunday, 387, after spending four months at Cassiciacum where he composed his earliest extant works. Shortly thereafter, Augustine began his return to Northern Africa, but not before his mother died at Ostia, a seaport outside Rome, while awaiting the voyage across the Mediterranean. Not too long after this, Augustine, now back in Thagaste, also lost his son (389). The remainder of his years would be spent immersed in the affairs and controversies of the Church into which he had been recently baptized, a Church that henceforth provided for Augustine the crucial nexus of relations that his family and friends had once been. In 391, Augustine was reluctantly ordained as a priest by the congregation of Hippo Regius (a not uncommon practice in Northern Africa), in 395 he was made Bishop, and he died August 430 in Hippo, thirty-five years later, as the Vandals were besieging the gates of the city. However, when Augustine himself recounts his first thirty-two years in his Confessions, he makes clear that many of the decisive events of his early life were, to use his own imagery, of a considerably more internal nature than the relatively external facts cited above.

From his own account, he was a precocious and able student, much enamored of the Latin classics, Virgil in particular [Confessions I.xiii.20]. However, at age nineteen, he happened upon Cicero's Hortensius, now lost except for fragments [see Straume-Zimmermann 1990], and he found himself suddenly imbued with a passion for philosophy [Confessions III.iv.7–8]. It is clear from his account of Cicero's effect upon him that his passion was not for philosophy as often understood today, i.e. an academic, largely argument-oriented conceptual discipline, but rather as the paradigmatically Hellenistic pursuit of a wisdom that transcended and blurred the boundaries of what are now viewed as the separate spheres of philosophy, religion, and psychology. In particular, philosophy for Augustine was centered on what is sometimes misleadingly referred to as “the problem of evil.” This problem, needless to say, was not the sort of analytic, largely logical problem of theodicy that later came to preoccupy philosophers of religion. For Augustine, the problem was of a more general and visceral sort: it was the concern with the issue of how to make sense of and live within a world that seemed so adversarial and fraught with danger, a world in which so much of what matters most to us is so easily lost [see e.g. Confessions IV.x.15]. In this sense, the wisdom that Augustine sought was a common denominator uniting the conflicting views of such Hellenistic philosophical sects as the Epicureans, Stoics, Skeptics, and Neoplatonists (though this is a later title) such as Plotinus and Porphyry, as well as many Christians of varying degrees of orthodoxy, including very unorthodox gnostic sects such as the Manicheans.

Augustine himself comes to spend nine years as a hearer among the Manicheans [see Brown 1967, pp. 46–60], and while there are no extant writings from this period of his life, the Manicheans are clearly the target of many of the writings he would compose after his conversion to the more orthodox, if Neoplatonizing, Christianity he encountered under Bishop Ambrose of Milan. The Manicheans proposed a powerful, if somewhat mythical and philosophically awkward explanation of the problem of evil: there is a perpetual struggle between co-eternal principles of Light and Darkness (good and evil, respectively), and our souls are particles of Light which have become trapped in the Darkness of the physical world. By means of sufficient insight and a sufficiently ascetic life, however, one could eventually, over the course of several lives, come to liberate the Light within from the surrounding Darkness, thus rejoining the larger Light of which the soul is but a fragmented and isolated part.

As Augustine recounts it in the Confessions [see Confessions V.3.5 and V.7.13] and elsewhere [e.g. De Moribus Ecclesiae Catholicae 1], he became disenchanted with the inability of the Manichean elect to provide sufficiently detailed and rigorous explanations of their cosmology. As a result, he began to drift away from the sect during his sojourn in Rome, flirting for awhile with academic skepticism [Confessions V.xiv.25] before finally coming upon the Platonizing influence of Ambrose and the “books of the Platonists” [Confessions VII.9.13]. When Augustine eventually comes to write about the Manicheans, there are three features upon which he will focus: their implicit materialism (a widespread feature of Hellenistic thought, the Neoplatonists being a notable exception); their substantive dualism whereby Darkness, and hence, evil, is granted a co-eternal, substantial existence opposed to the Light; and their identification of the human soul as a fragmented particle of the Light. According to Augustine, this latter identification not only serves to render the human soul divine, thereby obliterating the crucial distinction between creator and creature, but it also raises doubts about the extent to which the individual human soul can be held responsible for morally bad actions, responsibility instead being attributed to the body in which the soul (itself quasi material) is trapped. Although Augustine is vehement and at times merciless in his repudiation of the Manicheans, questions can still be asked about the influence the Manichean world-view continued to exert upon his understanding and presentation of Neoplatonic and Christian themes [see “Philosophical Anthropology” below].

The single most decisive event, however, in Augustine's philosophical development has to be his encounter with those unnamed books of the Platonists in Milan in 384. While there are other important influences, it was his encounter with the Platonism ambient in Ambrose's Milan that provided the major turning point, reorienting his thought along basic themes that would persist until his death forty-six years later. There has been controversy regarding just which books of the Platonists Augustine encountered [O'Connell 1968, pp. 6–10; O'Donnell 1992, vol. II, pp. 421–423; Beatrice, 1989], but we know from his own account that they were translated by Marius Victorinus [Confessions VIII.2.3], and there is widespread agreement that they were texts by Plotinus and Porphyry, although there is again controversy regarding how much influence is to be attributed to each [O'Connell 1968, pp. 20–26; O'Donnell 1992, vol II, pp. 423–4]. These uncertainties notwithstanding, Augustine himself makes it clear that it was his encounter with the books of the Platonists that made it possible for him to view both the Church and its scriptural tradition as having an intellectually satisfying and, indeed, resourceful content.

As decisive as this encounter was, however, it would be a mistake simply to view Augustine's writings as the uncritical application of a Neoplatonic framework to a static body of Christian doctrine. In his earliest writings [e.g. Contra Academicos, 386 C.E.], Augustine is amazingly confident with regard to the compatibility of the two traditions [see Contra Academicos 3.10.43]. But by the time he composes the Confessions (397–401C.E.), he is already aware that there are significant points of divergence [Confessions VII.20.26], and by the time he composes Book VIII of De Civitate Dei (circa 416 C.E.), he still has laudatory things to say about the Platonic tradition, but it is clear that the points of divergence have become more important to him and that he regards the Roman Catholic Church as having sufficient internal resources to address whatever difficulties confront it. Part of this gradual change of attitude is attributable to his detailed study of scriptural texts (especially the Pauline letters), as well as his immersion in both the daily affairs of his monastic community and the rather focused sorts of controversies that confronted the Church in the fourth and fifth centuries. Beyond his already noted, protracted battle with Manicheanism, there is also his involvement in the North African Donatist controversy [see Brown 1967, pp. 212–225], a controversy concerning the validity of sacraments administered in the wake of the persecution of 304–305, and most especially the Pelagian controversy which engaged him from about 411 until his death in 430 [see Brown 1967, pp. 340–52 and the section on “Will” below]. In this latter case, serious issues arose regarding the role of grace and the efficacy of the unaided human will, issues that, as we will see, played an important role in shaping his views on human freedom and predestination.

These important qualifications notwithstanding, the fact remains that this Platonism also provided Augustine with a philosophical framework far more pliable and enduring than he himself is willing to admit in his later works. Moreover, this framework itself forms an important part of the philosophical legacy that Augustine bequeathed to both the medieval and modern periods.

2. Reading The Confessions

Augustine's Confessions is undoubtedly among the most widely read works in medieval philosophy, for both philosophers and non-philosophers. Often hailed as the “first autobiography” and as a “spiritual biography,” it is nonetheless a work that has to be approached with considerable caution, for two main reasons. First, as is the case with all biographies and autobiographies, it is an edited account of an individual's life. Sometimes this feature is easy to overlook, but its significance is obvious enough: in composing such a work, the author is obliged to engage in an editorial process in which certain events and circumstances are highlighted and others omitted. Without this, the work would be rather like a map that is as large as of that of which it is intended to be a map, thus making it not a map at all. In order to bring some coherence to the material at hand, there must be some effort to provide an interpretive framework for the material, focusing on relevant and important highlights while omitting others that would obscure those highlights.

The second reason is more specific to Augustine: trained as a rhetorician, Augustine has a specific rhetorical strategy that needs to be kept in mind as one works through the text. Presented as an extended prayer to God, Augustine is not merely telling the tale of his own life, but also using his life as a concrete example of how an isolated individual soul can extricate itself from this state and Neoplatonically ascend to a unity that overcomes this isolation and attains to rest in God. Also important are the means by which he seeks to accomplish this task: his selection of events is quite deliberate, and he especially focuses upon his immersion and extrication from what he regards as his pre-reflective, materialist and common sense view of the world; the various kinds of relationships that both hinder and aid in this extrication; and the texts that he reads, some of which again aid in the extrication and others of which are obstacles.

With respect to his relations with others, he begins with his ruminations upon infancy and the isolation of the infant, which initially seems to be overcome by the acquisition of language. But as he tells the story in Confessions I, language is itself a double-edged sword: it is an instrument that can immerse us into the world, but it can also, if used rightly, aid in transcending the world of the senses and ascending to the intelligible realm where we find the unity and rest we seek. Of his remarks on friendship, especially noteworthy are the theft of pears in Book II; the death of his anonymous friend in Book IV; his accounts of Nebridius and Alypius; his account of his relationship with his mother, Monica; and, perhaps most significant of all, the “vision of Ostia” that is recounted in Book IX. Intertwined with his reflections on friendship is a progression of texts that leads him to the Neoplatonic ascents of Book VII and Book IX; his initial distaste for biblical texts owing to their rhetorical inelegance; his reading of Cicero, which inflamed him with a passion for philosophy; his attraction to the texts of the Manicheans; his reading of the Skeptics; and, most importantly, his reading of unnamed books of the “Platonists” which helped him to overcome his predisposition to materialism and paved the way for his non-Manichean, non-dualistic solution to the problem of evil, which enabled him to engage in the Neoplatonic ascent and thereby to overcome the fragmented isolation of bodies, the senses, and language. Although Augustine is aware by the time he writes the Confessions that there are differences between Christianity and Neoplatonism, he nonetheless makes its clear that the latter makes it possible for him to regard the former as intellectually credible.

Books VIII and IX continue in this autobiographical vein: Book VIII is notable for its complex and provocative accounts of Augustine's internal struggle of the will with respect to embracing his new-found, more orthodox form of Christianity, as well as his reading of I Corinthians 7:27–35, which finally completes his conversion. Book IX is notable for the aforementioned “vision at Ostia” in which he and his mother together ascend beyond the world of the senses and language in a manner akin to those ascents recounted in Book VII, but with one notable difference: unlike most Neoplatonic ascents, this one involves two individuals partaking in the ascent, which enables them to communicate in a manner that overcomes the Neoplatonic view of the isolated nature of the soul in this world.

The overarching Neoplatonic strategy of the first nine Books goes a long way toward explaining what might otherwise be a strange shift in the remaining four books, in which the autobiography recedes into the background. In Book X, Augustine focuses on the role of memory as a route of access to the transcendence that he is seeking, and Book XI emphasizes time and eternity, presenting the former as a psychological “distention” of the latter which needs to be overcome to reach the unity and rest in God that is the overall theme of the Confessions. This strategy, combined with the related themes of the role of language and texts in his spiritual progress, also explains the fact that Books XII and XIII are devoted to exegesis of the first chapters of Genesis. As noted above, Augustine at first disdained biblical texts owing to their rhetorical inelegance. Now, however, having a framework that enables him to discern their actual inner depth, these texts acquire a prominence and indicate the culmination of that long journey which began with his immersion into the double-edged domain of human speech and written word. Moreover, these final Books, along with the Neoplatonic framework he discovers in Book VII (though, as we have seen, it also governs the structure of the Confessions as a whole), enable him to further probe the puzzles that he raised in the first five chapters of Book I. In short, what once struck Augustine as the texts least worthy of attention have now become the texts of all texts, because they contain the answers to the questions and problems that have propelled him from the very beginning of the Confessions.

For the reader interested in approaching the Confessions with more historical background at their disposal, Brown (2000) and O'Donnell (2006) are reliable and helpful resources.

3. The Mysterious Woman From Northern Africa

For many readers, one of the most troubling passages of the Confessions occurs at VI.xv.25 where Augustine briefly discusses the abrupt dismissal of his unnamed companion of thirteen years who is also the mother of his son Adeodatus. As Augustine recounts it (Confessions VI.xiii.23), the dismissal was prompted by his mother's attempt to arrange a respectable marriage for him: one that would aid him in attaining the salvation that baptism could procure. It is also quite possible that it would serve him in the pursuit of a more worldly career.

The custom of having a “concubine” (concubinatus) was not unusual at the time, and it was virtually indistinguishable from formal marriage. But it could serve as an impediment to social advancement unless it was replaced by the more formal arrangement of matrimonium. What seems so troubling about this brief passage are the facts that Augustine never names his companion, that the dissolution of the relationship is treated with such brevity, and that Augustine almost immediately forms a relationship with another woman while waiting almost two years for his prospective, arranged bride to reach legal age for marriage (though the marriage never took place owing to Augustine's subsequent “conversion” recounted in Books VII and VIII).

Hence, the obvious questions: Why the abruptness of the dismissal? Why not enter with his companion of thirteen years into the more respectable relation of matrimonium? Why anonymity for someone with whom he had spent thirteen years in a monogamous relationship? Why the headlong rush into another, temporary relationship, whereas his companion returned to Northern Africa vowing never to enter into another relationship? Was their devotion to one another as asymmetrical as Augustine seems to suggest? Was he as callous and as indifferent as the text seems to present him?

If one examines the text closely enough, there do seem to be answers to these questions: some of them historically speculative, others definitely rooted in the text. In a speculative vein (though not without foundation) one must wonder what the mysterious woman's fortunes in Northern Africa would have been had her name been mentioned in the text. Also, what was the social class of his companion? Differences in social class could often prevent the transition from a relation of concubinatus to one matrimonium.

On a more textual level, it is obvious that Monica played a significant role in the arrangement of the more respectable marriage for which Augustine was obliged to wait. More importantly, Augustine makes it clear at VI.xv.23 that his companion's vow of chastity is to be regarded as superior to his pursuit of another relationship, which was prompted by lust rather than love, implying that this might not have been true of his relationship with his companion of thirteen years. As for the anonymity of his companion, this is not unusual in the Confessions as a whole. When he does mentions names (e.g. Alypius, Nebridius, Faustus, Ambrose, Monica), they are names that would have been known to contemporary readers of the text. But they also serve as character types: most positive, but some (like the well-known Manichean Faustus) of a more ambivalent sort. The fact that a name is not mentioned does not mean that Augustine's relation with that person is insignificant. A prime example is his protracted discussion of an anonymous friend in Book IV, a pathos-ridden account that leaves no doubt about the importance of the relationship to Augustine. Indeed, given the overall rhetorical strategy of the Confessions, in which his own life stands as a particular instance of the soul's immersion in and extrication from the isolation and fragmented condition brought about by the sensible world, it is more surprising when he does mention specific names.

But perhaps of most importance are two textual points which indicate the significance of this relationship to Augustine. The first is that the episode he recounts is of an intensely personal nature, not necessary to the rhetorical strategy of the Confessions as a whole. But even more important is the imagery employed in his account of the separation. He tells us that his “heart” (cor) was still attached(adhaerebat) to her, that it was wounded (conscium et vulneratum), and that the separation “drew blood” (trahebat sanguiem). There are only two passages in the entire Confessions which employ similar imagery: his account of the death of his anonymous friend at IV.vi.11, and his account of the death of his mother at IX.xii.30.

Given the imagery employed here, there does look to be some philosophical import in this otherwise intensely personal passage: it is one example of the Neoplatonic desperation of the individual soul's attempt to overcome its isolation by seeking unity with others, a unity that can ultimately only be found in the unity with God (IV.ix.14 and XI.xxix.39).

Needless to say, this does not completely exonerate Augustine. If it was indeed under Monica's influence that he dissolved the relationship, it is unclear why, given the importance that he clearly attached to it, he could not have resisted her influence. And if the choice was his own, then he appears even more culpable. But then, given the travail of the soul's journey presented in the first six books of the Confessions,, perhaps this is precisely the point.

4. Ontology and Eudaimonism

A good place to begin examining the larger contours of Augustine's legacy is his account of the impact the books of the Platonists had upon him, i.e., his ontology and the eudaimonism it is intended to support.

In the Confessions, where Augustine gives his most extensive discussion of the books of the Platonists, he makes clear that his previous thinking was dominated by a common-sense materialism [Confessions IV.xv.24; VII.i.1]. It was the books of the Platonists that first made it possible for him to conceive the possibility of a non-physical substance [Confessions VII.x.16], providing him with a non-Manichean solution to the problem of the origin of evil. In addition, the books of the Platonists provided him with a metaphysical framework of extraordinary depth and subtlety, a richly-textured tableau upon which the human condition could be plotted. It can both account for the obvious difficulties with which life confronts us, while also offering grounds for a eudaimonism notable for the depth of its moral optimism. In this respect, the ontology that Augustine acquired from the books of the Platonists is, in terms of its intent, not all that different from the materialism of the Epicureans, Stoics, and even the Manicheans. What sets the Neoplatonic ontology apart, however, is both the resoluteness of its promise and the architectonic grandeur with which it complements the world of visible appearances.

In the books of the Platonists, Augustine encountered an ontology in which there is a fundamental divide between the sensible/physical and the intelligible/spiritual [Confessions VII.x.16]. In spite of the dualistic implications, this is clearly not intended to be a dualistic alternative to the moral dualism of the Manicheans and other gnostics [see, e.g. Plotinus, Enneads II.9]. Instead, the divide is situated within what is supposed to be a larger, unified hierarchy that begins with absolute unity and progressively unfolds through various stages of increasing plurality and multiplicity, culminating in the lowest realm of isolated and fragmented material objects observed with the senses [see Bussanich 1996, pp. 38–65; O'Meara 1996, pp. 66–81]. Thus, for Augustine, God is regarded as the ultimate source and point of origin for all that comes below. Equated with Being [Confessions VII.x.16], Goodness [e.g. De Trinitate VIII.5], and Truth [Confessions X.xxiii.33; De Libero Arbitrio III.16], God is the unchanging point which unifies all that comes after and below within an abiding and providentially-ordained rational hierarchy.

Augustine, especially in his earlier works, focuses upon the contrast between the intelligible and the sensible, enjoining his reader to realize that the former alone holds out what we seek in the latter: the world of the senses is intractably private and isolated, whereas the intelligible realm is truly public and simultaneously open to all [De Libero Arbitrio II.7] ; the sensible world is one of transitory objects, whereas the intelligible realm contains abiding realities [De Libero Arbitrio II.6]; the sensible world is subject to the consumptive effects of temporality, whereas the intelligible realm is characterized by an atemporal eternity wherein we are safely removed from the eviscerating prospect of losing what and whom we love [Confessions XI.xxxix.39; see also Confessions IV.xii.18]. Indeed, in the vision at Ostia at Confessions IX.x.23–25, Augustine even seems to suggest that the intelligible realm holds out the prospect of fulfilling our desire for the unity that we seek in friendship and love, a unity that can never really be achieved as long as we are immersed in the sensible world and separated by physical bodies subject to inevitable dissolution [see Mendelson 2000]. The intelligible realm, with God as its source, promises the only lasting relief from the anxiety prompted by the transitory nature of the sensible realm.

Despite its dualistic overtones, the overall unity of the picture is central to its ability to provide a resolution of the problem of evil. The sensible world, for example, is not evil, nor is embodiment itself to be regarded as straightforwardly bad. The problem that plagues our condition is not that we are trapped in the visible world (as it is for the Manicheans); rather, it is a more subtle problem of perception and will: we are prone to view things materialistically and hence unaware that the sensible world is but a tiny portion of what is real [Confessions IV.xv.24], an error Augustine increasingly attributes to original sin [De Libero Arbitrio III.20; De Civitate Dei XIII.14–15]. Thus, we have a tendency to focus only upon the sensible, viewing it as a self-contained arena within which all questions of moral concern are to be resolved. Because we fail to perceive the larger unity of which the sensible world is itself a part, it easily becomes for us (though not in itself) a realm of moral danger, one wherein our will attaches itself to transitory objects that cannot but lead to anxiety [Confessions VII.xi.17–18]. Given the essentially rational nature of the human soul and the rational nature of the Neoplatonic ontology, there is nonetheless room for optimism. The human soul has the capacity to perceive its own liminal status as a being embodied partly in the sensible world while connected to the intelligible realm, and there is thus the possibility of reorienting one's moral relation to the sensible world, appreciating it for the goodness it manifests, but seeing it as an instrument for directing one's attention to what is above it [see Confessions VII.x.16 and VII.xvii.23]. Augustine's employment of this Neoplatonic hierarchy is thus central to his Hellenistic eudaimonism [see O'Connell 1972, pp. 39–40; Rist 1994, pp. 48–53; Kirwan 1999, pp. 183–4] which would redeem appearances by means of situating them within a more primary, if often unacknowledged context.

With respect to questions about specific instances of natural and moral evil, this ontology is even more subtle. Natural evils are attributed to the partiality of our perspective, a perspective that is often the result of our myopic materialism and tendency to focus upon our own self-interest. Understood within the larger context—both the underlying order of the appearances and the providentially governed moral drama within which they appear—natural evils are not evil at all [e.g. Confessions VII.xiii.19 and De Civitate Dei XI.22]. With respect to the moral evil which is the product of human agency, these are the culpable products of a will that has become attached to lower goods, treating them as if they were higher. Moral evil is, strictly speaking, not a thing, but only the will's turning away from God and attaching itself to inferior goods as if they were higher [ibid.]. In De Civitate Dei, Augustine emphasizes the privative nature of evil by referring to the will's pursuit of inferior goods as being a deficient rather than efficient cause [De Civitate Dei, XII.7]. The inherent difficulty of this notion aside [see Rist 1994, pp. 106–8], the point behind it is clear enough: Augustine is using the resources of Neoplatonism to account for the phenomena we label evil while stressing human responsibility, thus avoiding either substantializing evil (as the Manicheans do) or making it the result of God's creative activity.

For all that Augustine takes from the books of the Platonists, there are two points where he conspicuously departs from their ontology. Frequently, Plotinus asserts that the ultimate principle, The One, is itself of such absolute unity and transcendence that, strictly speaking, it defies all predication and is itself beyond Being and Goodness [see, for example, Plotinus, Enneads, VI.9.3]. Augustine himself does not comment upon this feature of Plotinus' thought, and thus one can only conjecture as to his reason for resisting it, but given his repeated emphasis upon the soul's relation to God [e.g. Soliloquia 1.2.7 and De Ordine 2.18.47], the Plotinian picture may have seemed to him as positing too great a distance between the two, thus raising doubts about the ability of reason to take us towards our desired destination [see Mendelson 1995, pp. 244–45]. The other departure from Neoplatonism moves in the opposite direction. Rather than the danger of making the spiritual distance between God and the soul too great, there is as well in Neoplatonism a tendency to bridge that gap in a manner troubling to someone like Augustine, for whom the creator/creature distinction is fundamental. In Plotinus and other Neoplatonists, the relation of the ultimate principle to all that comes below is usually presented in terms of a sempiternal process of necessary emanations whereby lower stages constantly flow from the higher [see Plotinus, Enneads IV.8.6]. Augustine, not surprisingly, resists this aspect of the Neoplatonic ontology, always insisting upon the fundamentally volitional nature of God's activity [e.g. De Genesi ad Litteram 6.15.26]. Nor should it be surprising that Augustine should find himself obliged to depart in important respects from the Neoplatonic tradition. He is, after all, not merely taking over a Neoplatonic ontology, but he is attempting to combine it with a scriptural tradition of a rather different sort, one wherein the divine attributes most prized in the Greek tradition (e.g. necessity, immutability, and atemporal eternity) must somehow be combined with the personal attributes (e.g. will, justice, and historical purpose) of the God of Abraham, Isaac, and Jacob.

For all the changes that affected Augustine between his initial encounter with the books of the Platonists in 384–386 and his death in 430, he never abandoned this Neoplatonic ontology's distinction between the physical/sensible and the spiritual/intelligible and its hierarchy within which these realms are unified. However, these commitments still leave much room for development as well as for tension and uncertainty. In particular, Augustine's views on original sin and the necessity of grace in the face of the Pelagian controversy raised serious questions about the efficacy of the human will. Complicating the matter further is the question of the soul's origin, a question that has a significant impact on Augustine's philosophical anthropology.

5. Philosophical Anthropology

With respect to Augustine's desire to find a viable alternative to the awkward and intractable moral dualism of the Manicheans, there can be little question that his embracing of Neoplatonism is a positive development. Not only does it allow him to account for evil without substantializing it, but it also provides him with a unified account of the moral drama that constitutes the human condition. Even so, this metaphysical architectonic is prone to tensions of its own, some of which lend themselves to a kind of moral dualism not altogether unlike that of the Manicheans.

For Augustine, the individual human being is a body-soul composite, but in keeping with his Neoplatonism, there is an asymmetry between soul and body. As a spiritual entity, the soul is superior to the body, and it is the province of the soul to rule the body [e.g. De Animae Quantitate 13.22; De Genesi contra Manicheos II.11]. This presents a fairly positive conception of the soul-body relation, one that clearly runs counter to the Manichean picture of the soul's entrapment. Matters are somewhat less clear, however, when we turn to the question of how the soul comes to be embodied.

With respect to the soul's “origin,” as Augustine frames the question, there is a strand of uncertainty that runs unbroken from his earliest completed post-conversion work [De Beata Vita, 386 C.E.] to the Retractationes of 427 C.E. In both works, Augustine professes to be puzzled about the soul's origin [De Beata Vita 1.5 and Rectractationes 1.1 and 2.45/71], but his uncertainty is clearly evolving, and the absence of certainty on the issue should not be interpreted as neutrality or indifference.

It is also important to note that, for Augustine, this evolving uncertainty is itself to be understood against the backdrop of other points about which he never seems to waver after 386. He became adamant, for example, that the soul is to be identified with neither the substance of God, nor with the body, nor with any other material entity [Letters 143 and 166.3–4]. In addition to the status of the soul as both created and immaterial (both points contrasting with the Manicheans), he also insists upon the mutability of the human soul, a feature that not only serves to distinguish it from its creator but one that he views as necessary to explain the possibility of moral change, be it for better or worse [Letter 166.3; Confessions IV.xv.26].

In De Libero Arbitrio III.20 & 21 (circa 395 C.E.), when Augustine first attends to the question of the soul's origin in a manner that focuses upon particular possibilities, he does so as part of an anti-Manichean theodicy intended to show that it is the human soul rather than God that is responsible for the presence of moral evil in the world. Thus, as he later points out in Letter 143 (circa 412 C.E.), he is not concerned to adjudicate between these competing hypotheses, but merely to show that each is consistent with a non-Manichean, Neoplatonizing account of moral evil. Nonetheless, the four hypotheses he does advance are important evidence about how he understands the conceptual landscape [O'Daly 1987, pp. 15–20; Mendelson 1998, pp. 30–44], and the anti-Manichean polemic notwithstanding, it is instructive that he makes no attempt to choose between or even to offer a tentative ranking of them.

Interestingly enough, two of the four hypotheses require the soul's existence prior to embodiment. On the first, the soul is sent by God to administer the body (henceforth the “sent” hypothesis); on the second, the soul comes to inhabit the body by its own choice (henceforth the “voluntarist” hypothesis). In later presentations of these hypotheses (though not in De Libero Arbitrio III), Augustine treats the voluntarist hypothesis as involving both a sin on the soul's part and a cyclical process whereby the soul is subject to multiple incarnations [Letter 166.27]. The other two hypotheses, the “traducianist” and the “creationist,” do not involve pre-existence, but there is nonetheless a significant contrast between them. On the traducianist account, all souls are propagated from Adam's soul in a manner analogous to that of the body, thus linking each soul to all previous ones by a kind of genealogical chain. On the creationist hypothesis, however, God creates a new soul for each body, thus creating a kind of vertical link between God and each individual soul.

These hypotheses do not exhaust the logical possibilities, but they were the main contenders in Augustine's time. There remains controversy over the extent to which Augustine himself was inclined towards either of the hypotheses that required pre-existence [O'Connell 1968, O'Daly 1987, pp. 15–20; O'Donnell 1992 II.34–5], but there are passages in the Confessions [see Confessions I.6–8] and elsewhere [e.g. De Genesi Contra Manicheos 2.8 (circa 388–9 C.E.) and De Genesi ad Literam Imperfectus Liber 1.3 (circa 393 C.E.)] that have led some to regard it as a possibility he takes very seriously indeed, perhaps even preferring it, at least until the early part of the fifth century [O'Connell 1968; Teske 1991]. Moreover, given the Neoplatonic architectonic of the Confessions, this would not be all that surprising, for the notion that the preexistent soul falls into the body is a conspicuous feature of Plotinus' thought as well as of Neoplatonism in general [e.g. Plotinus, Enneads IV.8; Origen, On First Principles 1.4.4]. In this regard, it is also not surprising that Augustine should have come to identify the hypothesis of the soul's voluntary descent into the body as involving both sin and cyclicism. Not only are these features reminiscent of what he eventually came to learn of Origen's view, but given the Neoplatonic framework underlying his conception of the soul's origin, it is difficult to construe the soul's choice of embodiment in positive terms.

There is a puzzle at the heart of Augustine's philosophical anthropology, however, that raises serious questions about how we are to construe the human condition. Depending on which of the four hypotheses one were to choose, our condition can be regarded as a divinely ordained exile and trial (the sent hypothesis), the consequence of sin conjoined with an almost immediately self-inflicted punishment (the voluntarist hypothesis), or as some kind of relatively natural habitat (the traducianist and creationist hypotheses). In the latter case, there remain questions about how to construe the soul's creation in relation to God's activity (mediated in traducianism, direct in creationism) as well as about how at home the soul is in the realm of nature.

By the time Augustine comes to write Letter 166 to Jerome in 415, there have been significant developments in his thinking on this issue. While he does not here sharply distinguish between the two hypotheses involving pre-existence, he is clearly bothered by the cyclicism he has increasingly come to associate with pre-existence, especially as it raises the prospect of a moral landscape wherein pre-incarnate and post-mortem sins are a genuine possibility, for this would entail that that there can be no security even for those who die in a state of grace [Letter 166.27]. Moreover, by the time he writes Book 10 of De Genesi ad Litteram, (circa 415–16 C.E.) he has a further objection to the notion of pre-incarnate sin: this possibility, he writes, is ruled out by Romans 9:11 where we are told that the souls of the unborn have done neither good nor evil [De Genesi ad Litteram 10.15.27]. Whether or not this poses a decisive objection pre-existence is an obscure matter. In the discussion of De Genesi ad Litteram 10, a version of the sent hypothesis does appear as a serious contender, but it is abruptly dropped without explanation, leaving open the question of what lies behind the sudden omission [O'Connell 1987, pp. 227–9; Mendelson 1995, pp. 242–7]. Whatever the reasons may be, the fact is that henceforward, in this text and elsewhere [e.g. De Anima et eius Origine, circa 419/20 C.E.], Augustine writes as if there are only two competing hypotheses of the soul's origin, the traducianist and the creationist.

Matters are further complicated by the fact that in Letter 166 and De Genesi ad Litteram [see especially Letter 166.27], Augustine makes clear his antipathy to the traducianist hypothesis, an antipathy that, while unexplained, seems to go beyond the materialism in which Tertullian had originally cast it. Creationism, however, hardly offers an unproblematic alternative. Both Letter 166 and De Genesi ad Litteram reveal concern over the question of the acquisition of original sin, an issue that becomes all the more pressing when one considers the plight of the infant who dies unbaptized [Letter 166.16 and De Genesi ad Litteram 10.11–16]. The Pelagian controversy had by this time brought to the fore the issues of grace and moral autonomy, and Augustine is now adamant in insisting upon the necessity of grace and infant baptism in the face of what he regards as Pelagian challenges to these views. In this context, the case of the infant who dies prior to baptism seems to present the hardest case of all, and the creationist hypothesis, with its direct account of the soul's relation to God's creative activity, seems singularly at a loss to address it. Augustine feels obliged to confirm, contra the Pelagians, the condemnation of the unbaptized infant, but on a creationist reading of the soul's origin, this is hard to reconcile with divine justice, especially given the notion that the unborn have done neither good nor evil. Not surprisingly, the Pelagians themselves favor the creationist hypothesis, for it seems to fit best with their views on the individual's ability to fulfill the moral obligations of the Christian life [TeSelle 1972, pg. 67; Bonner 1972 pp. 23 & 30].

It is thus, again, not surprising that there is an unofficial fifth hypothesis that can be found elsewhere in Augustine's works. In De Civitate Dei, for example, Augustine suggests that God created only one soul, that of Adam, and subsequent human souls are not merely genealogical offshoots (as in traducianism) of that original soul, but they are actually identical to Adam's soul prior to assuming their own individual, particularized lives [De Civitate Dei, 13.14]. Not only does this avoid the mediation of the traducianist hypothesis, but it also manages to provide a theologically satisfying account of the universality of original sin without falling into the difficulties of God's placing an innocent soul into a sin-laden body, as would be the case in a general creationism. To what extent this constitutes a serious contender for Augustine's attention remains a matter of controversy [O'Connell 1987, esp. pp. 11–16; Rist 1989; Rist 1994, pp 121–9; Teske 1999 pg. 810]. As noted earlier, when Augustine writes of the soul's origin in the Retractationes near the end of his life, he still asserts the obscurity and difficulty of the issue, and he is clearly reluctant to take a decisive stand on it. Although he sometimes downplays the seriousness of this uncertainty [e.g. De Libero Arbitrio III.21.59 and De Genesi ad Litteram, 10.20], there is no getting around the fact that it leaves a significant lacuna at the heart of his philosophical anthropology, one which leaves unanswered crucial questions about how we are to understand the embodied status of the human soul. His Neoplatonic framework commits him to the view that the physical/sensible realm is an arena of temptation and moral danger, one wherein the human soul needs to be wary about becoming too attached to lower goods. However, Augustine's enduring ambivalence on the question of the soul leaves open the possibility that the physical/sensible realm is more than an arena of danger and that it is in fact a fundamentally alien context, not altogether different from the Manichean view of embodiment as a kind of entrapment. The ontological unity of the Neoplatonic hierarchy notwithstanding, there appears to be room in it for a moral dualism that may be as troubling in the end as that of the Manicheans.

6. Psychology and Epistemology

While Augustine remains vague about how we are to understand our embodied status, there is never any question that human life is to be conceived in terms of the categories of body and soul and that an adequate understanding of the soul is necessary for an appreciation of our place within the moral landscape around us. Here Augustine is once again best understood in light of the Greek philosophical tradition [see O'Daly 1987, pp. 11–15], in which “soul” need not have any spiritual connotations. It is, instead, the principle that accounts for the intuitively obvious distinction between things that are living and things that are not. To be alive is to have a soul, and death involves a process leading to the absence of this principle. Thus, not only do human beings have souls, but so do plants and other animals [e.g. De Libero Arbitrio I.8; De Quantitate Animae, 70; De Civitate Dei V.10]. Augustine's view is not unlike what one finds, for example, in Plato's Timaeus [e.g. 89d-92c] or Aristotle's De Anima [e.g. 414b-415a] where different levels of soul are discussed in terms of ascending degrees of complexity in their capacities, e.g., souls capable only of reproduction and nutrition, or of sensation and locomotion as well, or finally, of rational thinking. As noted in the previous section, there is an asymmetry in these functional capacities, and reason is seen as higher than the others.

As the history of Classical Greek philosophy shows, this schema leaves open a number of possibilities in terms of the relation of soul and body (dualism, hylomorphism, and materialism, to cite some of the more obvious examples), as well as room for disagreement concerning the soul's prospect for continued existence upon the dissolution of the body (Aristotelians tended towards and Epicureans actually embraced a mortalist position, whereas Platonists and Stoics were somewhat more optimistic). For Augustine, however, it is virtually axiomatic that the human soul is both immaterial and immortal. It is worth noting in this connection that while the Christian scriptural tradition clearly alludes to the idea of post-mortem existence, the issue of the soul's immateriality is another matter. It is not obvious that the scriptural tradition requires this, and Tertullian (160–230 C.E.) is a prime example of an early Christian thinker who felt comfortable with a materialist ontology [e.g. Tertullian, De Anima 37.6–7]. Thus, while the immortality of the soul is arguably a point of happy convergence of these two traditions, Augustine's emphasis upon the soul's immateriality, an emphasis that comes to have enormous historical importance, seems largely a contribution of his Neoplatonism. As we have seen, he insists upon the soul's mutability as being necessary to account for moral progress and deterioration; however, it is also clear that there must be limits to this mutability, and a material soul would not only run counter to Neoplatonic ontology, but it would also impose upon the soul a degree of vulnerability that would destroy the eudaimonistic promise that made the Neoplatonic ontology so attractive in the first place.

In keeping with the intellectualism of the Greek philosophical tradition, Augustine's psychology focuses upon the asymmetrical and dominant relation that reason is supposed to exert over other capacities. Unlike post-Humean and post-Freudian views wherein considerable attention is focused upon the role of the non-rational influences that govern our thought, Augustine takes over the ancient Greek confidence in the superiority of the rational over the non-rational. As we will see in the next section, Augustine's views on the will tend to complicate things by qualifying the extent of his intellectualism, but certainly in epistemic contexts his intellectualism tends to hold sway. In this regard, the psychological hierarchy elaborated in De Libero Arbitrio II [II.3–II.15 ] and elsewhere [e.g. Confessions VII.x.16 and VII.xvi.21] is a useful illustration of his view.

In the psychology that emerges in De Libero Arbitrio II, Augustine posits a three-fold hierarchy of things that merely exist, things that exist and live, and things that exist, live, and possess understanding [De Libero Arbitrio II.3]. While he elsewhere allows that plants have souls, his primary interest is in souls capable of understanding, and here, as elsewhere, he is less concerned with a neutral description of the structure of nature than with showing how the soul may find happiness by extricating itself from an overly immersed relation to nature. This being the case, Augustine's psychology tends to focus upon cognitive capacities, beginning with sense perception and working up to reason. The criteria governing the hierarchy are the relative publicity of the object of the cognitive capacity [De Libero Arbitrio II.7 & 14], the reliability of the capacity and its object [De Libero Arbitrio II.8 & 12], and, corresponding to both of these, the relative degree of immateriality and immutability of the object [De Libero Arbitrio II.8 & 14]. Relying upon the criterion of relative publicity, Augustine begins by noting that even among the senses there is a hierarchy of sorts, for vision and hearing seem considerably less private than both smell and taste, wherein part of the object must actually be taken into one's body and consumed during the process [De Libero Arbitrio II.7]. Likewise, it seems possible to see or hear the same object at the same time. In between these two extremes is the sense of touch, since two individuals can touch the same part of an object, but not at the same time. Augustine also emphasizes the fact that even in sight and hearing, the most public of the senses, one's relation to the object is always perspectival. For example, one's visual or aural relation to the object imposes limits upon how many others can have a similar relation, as well as the nature of the relation they can have. Thus, sense experience, in addition to relating to objects that are material, mutable, and hence ultimately unreliable, is also intractably private, this latter point being of considerable importance, as we will see, with respect to Augustine's theory of illumination.

The senses are coordinated by what Augustine refers to as the “inner sense” [De Libero Arbitrio II.3], a faculty that bears some affinities to Aristotle's common sense [see Aristotle, De Anima II.6]. The inner sense for Augustine makes us aware that the disparate information converging upon us from our various senses comes from a common external source (e.g., the smell and taste belong to the same object one is looking at while holding it in one's hand). The inner sense also makes us aware when one of the senses is not functioning properly. In both of these respects, the inner sense bears an organizational and criterial relation to the senses, not only combining the information of the senses, but passing judgment on the results of this synthesis. It is for this reason regarded as being above the other senses [De Libero Arbitrio II.5]. At this point, however, we are still at a level shared with non-rational beings. It is only when we go above the inner sense and turn to reason that we reach what is distinctively human.

As with most thinkers influenced by the Greek philosophical tradition, Augustine conceives of reason rather austerely, focusing upon the mind's ability to engage in deductive reasoning, where logical necessity is the criterion of adequacy. The point is an important one, for it helps explain the belief that reason is distinctively human (intuitively, we may want to attribute instrumental reasoning to other species, but there is still reluctance to attribute mathematical reasoning to them), as well as our tendency to place such enormous significance upon the fact that humans are capable of reasoning. Understood in this austere sense, i.e. in terms of the mind's ability to recognize logical necessity, reason is not merely one instrument among many; instead, it becomes the means whereby the human soul comes into contact with truths that are devoid of the mutability afflicting the objects of the senses. For Augustine, reason is the cognitive apex of the human soul, not only because it distinguishes us from other creatures, but more importantly for the way it distinguishes us: it gives us access to truths that are of an absolutely reliable sort [De Libero Arbitrio II.8].

It is also important to note that the necessity revealed by reason is not merely logical and certainly not merely psychological. Augustine, like other thinkers influenced by the Greek tradition, saw an ontological dimension in the truths of reason, i.e., an isomorphism between the necessity that governs our thinking and the necessity that governs the structure of that about which we are thinking. It is at this point that we come upon the intersection of Augustine's psychology and epistemology, for even if we assume a kind of isomorphism between the truths of reason and the structure of being, there is an enduring historical controversy regarding what structure reason reveals as well as how the truths of reason relate to the other cognitive capacities such as sense perception and imagination.

As we have seen, from 384 onwards Augustine accepted a Neoplatonic account of the ontological and moral condition in which we find ourselves. Moreover, the psychology sketched in De Libero Arbitrio II and elsewhere reflects an ascending hierarchy of capacities (sense perception, inner sense, and reason), providing a psychological analogue to the ontological hierarchy. Not surprisingly, Augustine's epistemology reflects these strongly Neoplatonic tendencies, but here, as elsewhere, it would be a mistake to view Augustine's thought as an uncritical application of an inherited framework; as is often the case in other areas, Augustine's approach to epistemology is conditioned by his own religious and philosophically eudaimonistic concerns.

In particular, Augustine's epistemology seeks to exploit the psychological hierarchy with the aim of showing the reader how to navigate through the corresponding ontological hierarchy, thereby enabling us to reap the moral benefits of his Christianized Neoplatonism. This point is important, for it helps to explain why Augustine can seem, at times, so overtly indifferent towards questions that are central from the perspective of later (especially post-Cartesian) epistemology. A case in point is Augustine's treatment of Academic skepticism. As already noted, Augustine flirted with Academic skepticism, and one of his first extant works, Contra Academicos (circa 386 C.E.) is a focused, if at times idiosyncratic argument against Academic skepticism. Leaving aside Augustine's claim that the Academic skeptics were really Platonic realists attempting to conceal their view from those too simple to grasp its subtlety [e.g. Contra Academicos, 3.17.37 and Letter 1.1], the overall argumentative thrust of the text is nonetheless instructive [see also Kirwan, 1983].

In the Contra Academicos, as elsewhere, Augustine attacks skepticism as an obstacle on the road to a eudaimonistically-construed happiness. Thus he is content to show that there are problems in the skeptic's claim to live by the likeness of truth (how can one know the likeness of x if one professes not to know x itself?) [Contra Academicos 2.7.16–2.8.20], and to offer a set of examples where we do have certainty regarding the truth [Contra Academicos 3.10.23 and 3.11.25]. What Augustine does not do is to engage in any kind of foundationalist construction of basic beliefs, nor does he attempt any kind of systematic defense of our ordinary epistemic practices so as to vindicate them in the face of skeptical attack. Even when he offers his version of what later becomes known as the Cartesian cogito [e.g. De Civitate Dei XI.26; De Trinitate 10.14; see also De Libero Arbitrio II.3 and Rist 1994, pp. 63–7], he shows no interest in using it to epistemically ground other beliefs [see Markus 1967, pp. 363–4]. Here, as elsewhere, Augustine is content to attack skepticism on a piecemeal basis [see Matthews 1972; O'Daly 1987, pg. 171; and Rist 1994, pg. 53].

Another, related, feature of Augustine's epistemology is his willingness to accept that much of our belief about the world must as a matter of practical necessity rest upon trust and authority. As he tells us in De Magistro, we cannot hope to verify all our beliefs about history and even many beliefs about the present are a matter of trust [De Magistro 11.37]. Here as elsewhere, he emphasizes the role of belief as opposed to understanding, pointing out not only that we must believe many things that we cannot understand but also that belief is a necessary condition of understanding [see Contra Academicos 3.20.43; De Libero Arbitrio II.2; and Rist 1994, pp. 56–63]. From a Cartesian foundationalist perspective, this can seem a troublingly circular view. However, we are again obliged to note that Augustine's epistemological concerns do not lie in vindicating our beliefs about the sensible world in the face of skeptical doubt, but in utilizing our non-skeptical intuitions about the sensible world to construct an accessible and rhetorically compelling account of our relation to the intelligible realm, the latter serving as the haven towards which his eudaimonism consistently points. It is worth noting, moreover, that even among those who do not share Augustine's enthusiasm for the transcendental, there are many philosophers in this century who would applaud his indifference towards Cartesian foundationalist concerns. Certainly, his views on the relation of belief, authority, and understanding are worthy of contemporary attention. But for Augustine himself, the primary concern is to lay the groundwork for what many regard as the least compelling if nonetheless most conspicuous element of his epistemology, the doctrine of divine illumination [see Markus 1967, pp. 363–73; Nash 1969; O'Daly 1987, pp. 199–207; and Rist 1994, pp. 73–9].

Augustine presents our grasp of the sensible world as grounded in a relatively unproblematic relation of direct acquaintance [e.g De Magistro 12.39. See also Burnyeat 1987], although there are places where his view is complicated by his Neoplatonizing conviction that the higher (e.g. the mind) cannot be affected by the lower (e.g. the body) [e.g. De Genesi ad Litteram XII.16 circa 415 C.E.]. In fact, he will in places explicate the mind's relation to sensible objects by means of its focusing its attention and noticing what is presented to it by the body without being causally affected by the body; in the case of physical vision, he will even go so far as to adopt the extramissionist view that a visual ray extends from the eye to the object as opposed to an intromissionist view whereby the eye passively receives something from the sensible object [e.g. De Quantitate Animae 23.43, circa 388 C.E.]. Even so, direct acquaintance is at some level still a necessary condition for the formation of beliefs about the external world, and the relation of the senses to sensible objects is regarded as largely unproblematic. In De Magistro, for example, Augustine argues that the efficacy of language is ultimately dependent upon direct acquaintance with the external world, and even our ability to learn from others presupposes that what they tell us can be reduced to elements with which one has had some prior acquaintance [De Magistro 11.37]. For Augustine, as for many classical thinkers, language is a kind of third realm entity. Belonging neither to the world nor to mind, it is an instrument used by minds to communicate about the world outside them, and direct acquaintance is what explains its ability to do so. Thus, learning from others is a matter of being reminded of prior acts with which we have been directly acquainted [De Magistro 11.36], although this reminding can occur in such a way as to reconfigure elements from those prior acts, thus accounting for the fact that our knowledge of the world seems to be extended by such descriptions.

However odd such a model might seem, it is important to note the plausibility of some of the assumptions that underlie it: (a) language is an instrument that mediates our relation to the world and to other minds; (b) there is a distinction between signs and what they signify; and (c) our relation to the sensible world is based on direct experience. Each of these assumptions is subject to serious objections, and the past two centuries have produced ample reasons to be cautious about them. Nevertheless, they still have considerable pre-reflective currency, and for all its oddness, Augustine's suggestion that learning is a matter of being reminded of prior acts of direct acquaintance rests upon a set of common sense assumptions. This in itself is an important point, for as noted above, much of Augustine's strategy in presenting his epistemology is to exploit the relatively unproblematic nature of our relation to the sensible world, and then to reason analogously regarding our relation to the more secure, public world of intelligible objects. The question we are supposed to ponder is: given that learning is really a matter of being reminded, and given that all such occasions of being reminded depend upon acts of direct acquaintance wherein we are taught by the things themselves [De Magistro 12.40], what does this imply about our relation to those truths that cannot be accounted for by sense perception? In other words, if we accept this as a viable model of our epistemic relation to the external world, how do we proceed from it to explain our access to those truths whose certainty goes beyond what can be experienced in sensible objects? The traditional example here is mathematics [e.g. De Libero Arbitrio II.8], and in De Libero Arbitrio II, Augustine even argues that our ability to count presupposes a notion of unity that is empirically underdetermined [ibid]. There are, of course, other examples for Augustine besides mathematical and logical truths. Of equal importance are such truths as the awareness that all seek a happiness that goes beyond anything we have experienced in this life, that good is to be sought and evil avoided, and the awareness that there is something above and more reliable than the human mind [see De Libero Arbitrio II.9 and 12]. These are the kinds of examples that Augustine regards as obliging us to reject the notion that our relation to the sensible world is sufficient to account for all our beliefs and to believe that there must be more, so to speak, to complete the picture.

That something more is provided by the doctrine of illumination, the thesis that God plays an active role in human cognition by somehow illuminating the individual's mind so that it can perceive the intelligible realities which God simultaneously presents to it. Augustine is notoriously vague as to the precise details and mechanics of this divine illumination [see, e.g. Nash 1969, pp. 94–124], and it is therefore easy to read it in an uncharitable light. Viewed without sufficient attention to the few details he provides, it can appear as if Augustine has made human cognition into a special act of divine revelation, thus making the human mind into a merely passive receptacle and God into a kind of epistemic puppeteer. For all its attendant vagueness, however, the doctrine is rather more sophisticated than it might first appear.

In the account of illumination in De Magistro, Augustine uses an analogy as old as Plato [see Republic VI.508a ff.] according to which the mind's relation to intelligible objects is like the relation of the senses to sensible objects [see De Magistro 12.39; see also Soliloquia 1.12 and O'Daly 1987, pg. 204]. In both cases, there is a need for an adventitious object to be presented to the relevant capacity, as well as the need for an environment that is conducive to the successful exercise of the relevant capacity. In the case of vision, for example, this would be light; in the case of the mind's discernment of intelligible objects, Augustine characterizes this, relying upon Platonic imagery of which Plotinus is also fond [see Plotinus, Enneads V.3.8 and Schroeder 1996, pp. 341–3], as an intellectual illumination that occurs within us by that which is above us. In both cases, the criterion of success is the discernment of the actual details of the object itself. Perhaps most important of all, both cases clearly allow for and rely upon acts of direct acquaintance, since illumination is, above all, meant to be an account of the conditions necessary for the mind to have direct acquaintance with intelligible objects.

Seen in this light, Augustine's view hardly seems to reduce human cognition to special acts of divine revelation [see O'Daly 1987, pp. 206–7]. Illumination is instead something that is available to all rational minds, the atheistic mathematician as well as the pious farmer measuring a field [see Rist 1994, pg. 77]. Nor does it detract from the mind's own activity and acuity, any more than a world of adventitious sensible objects detracts from the activity and acuity of the senses. In both sensory and intellectual perception, one can require a considerable degree of activity and acuity on the part of the perceiver, and in both cases one can treat failed perception as a function both of the extent to which the capacity is possessed by the perceiver and the perceiver's efforts to employ it. What sets illumination apart from more familiar cases of sense perception is that it enables us to do two related things that cannot be done by sense perception alone. First and foremost, it explains how our knowledge can have the kind of necessity that understanding (as opposed to mere belief) requires, a necessity that is always, it seems, empirically underdetermined [see, e.g. De Libero Arbitrio II.8 and O'Daly 1987, pp. 180–1]. In this regard, Augustine's illuminationism is a worthy contender among more familiar attempts to make intellectual cognition epistemically secure and reliable. Though it has its own difficulties, it is not clear that Augustinian illumination is all that more extravagant than Platonic recollection of a pre-incarnate existence [e.g. Plotinus, Enneads V.5], Aristotelian induction of particulars that somehow leads to necessary and universal truths [e.g. Aristotle, Posterior Analytics II.19], psychologically private Cartesian innate ideas [Meditations, “Third Meditation”], or Kantian transcendental idealism, wherein we are obliged to sacrifice the isomorophism of reality and thought that made necessity so attractive in the first place [e.g. Critique of Pure Reason, “Preface” to the First and Second Editions]. Indeed, viewed in this regard, it is not all that surprising that Augustinian illuminationism came to have the historical influence that it did, nor that Malebranche, writing some twelve hundred years later, would, in his concern with the psychologistic implications of Cartesian innate ideas, turn to Augustinian illuminationism as a model for his vision in God [see, e.g. The Search After Truth, Bk. II, Part Two, Chapter Six].

The second way in which illumination enables us to surpass what we are able to accomplish by means of sense perception alone is even more tightly connected to Augustine's Neoplatonizing eudaimonism. For souls which have become immersed in the sensible world and which are thereby separated from other souls by bodies, illumination is crucial to our attempt to recapture our lost unity. Unlike the perspectival and private realm of sense perception, illumination holds out the prospect of fulfilling the yearning to which Augustine's eudaimonism gives such prominence, the yearning to find a realm wherein we can overcome the vulnerability that besets us and the moral distance that divides us from one another. Both Augustine's Confessions and De Civitate Dei in their own ways portray this sort of philosophical and spiritual pilgrimage, and one would be hard pressed to find a better example than the vision at Ostia at Confessions IX.10.23–25 [see “Ontology and Eudaimonism” above]. There, Augustine and his mother Monica manage, albeit fleetingly, to find themselves in a place that is clearly not in space, united in a way that overcomes the distance imposed by their mortal bodies. This unification is for Augustine the eudaimonistic conclusion through which the pursuit of knowledge is vindicated and to which it is, ultimately, to be subordinated.

7. Will

As already noted, a conspicuous feature of the Greek philosophical tradition is its intellectualism. Not only is nature seen as governed by patterns that are accessible to the human mind, but human agency is conceived in terms that stress the role played by reason in a life that is in keeping with the larger order [see Markus 1967 pg. 387]. Reason is an instrument that is not only capable of acts of theoretical representation, but its exercise is also regarded as being of enormous practical significance. There are, to be sure, important and powerful non-rational factors that are relevant to our actions (e.g. appetite and desire), but in a well-ordered life they are to be constrained by the dictates of reason [see e.g. Plato, Republic IV.441e-4441 and Aristotle, Nicomachean Ethics X.7.1177a10–X.9.1179a33].

As we have seen above [e.g.“Ontology and Eudaimonism” & “Psychology and Epistemology”], Augustine is deeply affected by Greek intellectualism, and his own Neoplatonizing Christianity is imbued with a hierarchical structure that emphasizes the reliability of the intelligible in contrast to all that is sensible and physical. However, as Augustine's views on human agency develop, this picture is complicated by an increasing emphasis upon non-rational factors that influence our behavior and by a tendency to regard intellectualism as insufficient to explain the dynamics of human agency. Early in Augustine's career [e.g. De Libero Arbitrio I, circa 387/8 C.E.], there is a conspicuous emphasis on the will, and it is here that one encounters some of the most difficult and obscure aspects of his thought [see Djuth 1999, pg. 881]. Nevertheless, it marks both a significant divergence from the Greek philosophical tradition and the intersection of the philosophical and religious dimensions of his thought. Moreover, the more Augustine immersed himself in theological questions, the more prominence the nature and role of the will came to have in his writings, and his reflection upon the limited powers of the unaided will has much to do with the pessimism of his later writings.

An example of Augustine's increasing emphasis upon the will can be found in his account of his intellectual and moral transformation in Confessions VII–VIII. As we have seen [“Context” and “Ontology and Eudaimonism”], he credits the books of the Platonists with making it possible for him to conceive of a non-physical, spiritual reality [Confessions IV.xv.24; VII.i.1]. Likewise, they removed the intellectual stumbling blocks that had made it so difficult for him to accept the non-Manichean form of Christianity he found in Ambrose's Milan. However, when Augustine tells the story of his conversion in Confessions VII and VIII, he makes clear that although he ceased to have any genuine intellectual reservations regarding the Church [Confessions VII.xxi.27 and VIII.i.1], he remained unable to commit himself to the path he could see to be the right one [see Confessions VII.xx.26, VII.xxi.27, and VIII.i.1]. Throughout his discussion, Augustine indicates that certainty is not the issue; he regards his predicament as falling outside the scope of intellectual assent. The ensuing discussion of his struggle is surely one of the most famous in Christian literature [Confessions VIII in toto, esp. VIII.viii.19–VIII.xii.30], and it is marked by a subtlety of introspective analysis that defies any easy explication. Leaving aside the question of the accuracy of his account [O'Connell 1969, pp. 4–9 and 101–104; O'Donnell 1992, vol. 3, pp. 3–4 and 55–71], it is clear that Augustine is providing a dramatic account of moral transformation, one that stresses the role of intellectual discernment while at the same time highlighting his conviction that no amount of discernment is sufficient to account for what we might refer to, for want of a better phrase, as the phenomenology of internal moral conflict. In terms of this agonistic inner turmoil, the will as both present and emergent [Confessions VIII.v.11 and VIII.x.22] is on an equal footing with our powers of rational discernment.

There are three distinct features that explain why the will comes to have such prominence in Augustine's thinking. In Book I of De Libero Arbitrio, Augustine endeavors to construct an anti-Manichean theodicy [De Libero Arbitrio I.2], one that accounts for the presence of moral evil in the world without either substantializing it or finding its source in divine activity. In this regard, the will is what makes an action one's own, placing the burden of responsibility on the one performing the action [De Libero Arbitrio I.11]. By the time he composed Book III of De Libero Arbitrio, however, Augustine had come to conceive of the human condition in terms of the ignorance and difficulty that attend it [De Libero Arbitrio III.18], and these features tend to complicate the libertarian optimism of Book I by raising questions about whether it is even possible for us to overcome the ignorance and difficulty. But even here, the will is intended to serve as the fulcrum of moral responsibility [e.g. De Libero Arbitrio III.22].

Though closely related, the concern with moral responsibility needs to be distinguished from the points raised in the above discussion of Confessions VII–VIII. In that context, Augustine is still engaged in constructing an anti-Manichean portrait of the human condition, but he is equally concerned with the aspect of agency that falls outside the scope of a purely rational or intellectual analysis. This aspect of the discussion is heightened by the fact that the choice involves a fundamental moral reorientation running contrary to habits which have acquired a necessity all their own [Confessions VIII.v.10], but Augustine's discussion of the example suggests that he sees it as more than an idiosyncratic or isolated incident. Rather, it is intended to draw our attention to an introspectively accessible range of phenomena that forces us to acknowledge a fundamentally non-rational component of human volition.

There is, however, a third factor at work here. The problem of evil received a rather different treatment in the non-Hellenic religious and scriptural traditions than in the Greek tradition, a contrast that was not completely lost on Augustine as he increased his familiarity with the former [e.g. Ad Simplicianum, circa 396 C.E. and Confessions VII.ix.14]. Here, one finds less emphasis upon rational analysis and logical argumentation than upon pledged community membership, trans-generational authority, obedience to divinely-sanctioned standards, and, in some cases, an overt suspicion of intellectualism together with an emphasis upon the necessity of divine aid for moral transformation. This part of Augustine's inheritance helped to divert his attention away from the strictly rational features of human agency, and to invite him to think about rationality in new ways.

While it is no doubt a mistake to compartmentalize the religious and philosophical aspects of Augustine's classical inheritance, it is often helpful to view his thought as presenting a gradual movement away from a Greek intellectualism towards a voluntarism emphasizing the profound ignorance and difficulty of the human condition, as well as the need for divine aid to overcome the ignorance and difficulty. At the heart of this shift of emphasis are Augustine's developing views on the will. Not surprisingly, this development often has to be understood against the backdrop of the philosophical and theological difficulties that come to occupy him over the years.

One of these difficulties is the relation of human free will to divine foreknowledge. While it is tempting to view this as a conflict between Athens and Jerusalem, the problem initially arises within the Greco-Roman tradition itself [see Rist 1994, pg. 268]. Although Augustine's initial treatment of the problem at De Libero Arbitrio III.2–4 seems innocent of this fact, his later treatment at De Civitate Dei V.9–10 shows that he was aware of Cicero's discussion of the problem in De Divinatione and De Fato. It is also worth noting that in later medieval philosophy, we see the mirror-image of this problem in terms of the relation of divine freedom and power versus the extent of human knowledge [see, e.g. The Condemnation of 1277; Henry of Ghent, Quodlibet VIII, qu.9; John Duns Scotus, Ordinatio I, dist. 42]. In both cases, the problem is attributable to the notion of necessity which underlies the Greek conception of knowledge. In this particular case, the problem is how to reconcile the absolute necessity that attends God's knowledge (i.e. if God genuinely knows that x is going to happen, it is impossible for x not to take place—see De Libero Arbitrio III.4 and De Civitate Dei V.9) with the idea that there can be no moral responsibility unless it is in my power to choose to do other than I in fact do [e.g. De Libero Arbitrio III.3]. On the surface, freedom to do otherwise seems to rule out the possibility of foreknowledge, and conversely, foreknowledge seems to rule out the possibility of freedom to do otherwise. In both De Libero Arbitrio and De Civitate Dei, Augustine's treatment of this problem is complex and at times exceedingly obscure [see Rowe 1964 and Kirwan 1989,pp. 95–103], but his aim is clear enough. Augustine is anxious, contra the Manicheans and Cicero, to defend the compatibility of divine foreknowledge and human freedom by arguing that the free exercise of the will is among the events foreknown by God and that such foreknowledge in no way detracts from our culpability for our acts of willing [e.g. De Libero Arbitrio III.3 & 4; De Civitate Dei V.9]. The obscurity of the details notwithstanding, Augustine leaves no doubt that he wants to maintain both that God does have foreknowledge of our actions and that we are morally responsible for them.

Augustine's view becomes even more complicated, however, due to theological and doctrinal concerns. While the issue of predestination is not invoked in the discussion of divine foreknowledge and human freedom at De Civitate Dei V.9–10 [see Rist 1994, pp. 268–9], significant developments take place between the time Augustine composes De Libero Arbitrio III (circa 395 C.E.) and De Civitate Dei V (circa 415 C.E.). In particular, there are two events that have a momentous impact upon Augustine's work in the late 390's until his death in 430. The first is his increasing familiarity with scripture and the resulting modification of his earlier, Neoplatonizing views in light of what he finds in those texts. Pivotal in this regard is Ad Simplicianum (396 C.E.), wherein he focuses on a number of scriptural passages and begins to formulate his views on the universality of original sin and the necessity of grace to overcome its effects [see Bonner 1972, pp. 15–18 and Babcock 1979, pp. 65–67]. The second set of events center on his involvement in the Pelagian controversy, which occupied him from roughly 411 until his death in 430. Under the pressures of this controversy and in conjunction with his interpretation of scriptural and especially Pauline views on original sin and grace, the intellectualistic optimism of his earlier work was gradually transformed into an exceedingly grim view of the human moral landscape.

Pelagius himself is an obscure figure, as is his relation to the view that has come to bear his name (Bonner 1972, 31–35), but at the heart of the Pelagian position seems to be an emphatic insistence upon the principle that “ought implies can,” i.e. that it is unacceptable to require individuals to perform actions that they cannot in fact perform [Pelagius, Ad Demetriadem 2, op. cit. at Brown 1967, pg. 342; see also Bonner 1972, pg. 34]. The Pelagian insistence upon preserving the kind of autonomy that seems required by the moral ideals of Christianity set in motion a fierce controversy about the nature of original sin and the role of grace in overcoming it [Brown 1967, pp.340–364]. In general, Pelagians tended to deny the kind of insuperable original sin that Augustine believed he had found in scripture, and they proposed a milder view of grace as being an aid to a will disposed to a Christian life, as opposed to being a necessary condition for such a disposition in the first place [TeSelle 1999, pg. 635]. As is often the case with disputes that have a deep moral urgency, the controversy acquired a ferocity that can seem, from a modern perspective, out of keeping with the subtlety of the points made in it, but it is precisely the sort of dispute that cannot but have lasting effects upon its participants, and Augustine was one of the main participants during the last two decades of his life.

By the time Augustine completed De Civitate Dei in 427 C.E., he came even more emphatically to insist upon the conclusion to which his discussion in Ad Simplicianum had led him, i.e., that original sin is both universally debilitating and insuperable without the aid of unmerited grace [De Civitate Dei XIV.1]. Furthermore, there is a predestination at work that is as rigorous as the foreknowledge by which God knows its results [De Civitate Dei XIV.11]. Here too Augustine insists that we are morally culpable for the sinful choices that the will makes [De Civitate Dei XIV.3], but under the pressures of the Pelagian controversy—a controversy in which he will find his earlier words being cited against him [see Retractationes I.9.3–6]—he presents these views in a manner that is austere and uncompromising. So damaging are the effects of the original sin that the human will is free only to sin [De Correptione et Gratia 1.2; 11.31; Rist 1972, pg. 223]. Thus, the human race is comprised of a massa damnata [De Dono Perseverantiae 35; see also De Civitate Dei XXI.12], out of which God, in a manner inscrutable to us [De Civitate Dei XII.28], has predestined a small number to be saved [De Civitate Dei XXI.12], and to whom he has extended a grace without which it is impossible for the will not to sin. While there is some controversy over whether this grace is sufficient for redemption and whether it can be resisted [Rist, 1972, pp. 228ff.], Augustine makes clear that it is as much a necessary condition as it is unmerited and inscrutable. The ignorance and difficulty that afflict our condition in De Libero Arbitrio III have become more than obstacles to be overcome by means of our will [De Libero Arbitrio III.22]; they are now impassible barriers we have inherited from Adam, and without unmerited grace we are utterly incapable of initiating even the smallest movement away from sin and towards God. In De Libero Arbitrio I, Augustine suggests that the will is confronted by a rational choice between a life spent in the pursuit of what is temporal, changing, and perishable, and a life spent in the pursuit of what is eternal, immutable, and incapable of being lost [De Libero Arbitrio I.7]. By the time he comes to write De Gratia et Libero Arbitrio in 426 C.E., in the midst of the Pelagian controversy, we find a vastly different picture. Here too the will is central, and here too we are culpable for our sins, but gone is the earlier optimism. The post-Adamic will is no longer in a position to initiate any choice of lives; the fact that we have any choice at all is entirely a product of unmerited grace [see, e.g. De Gratia et Libero Arbitrio xx and xxi], a grace that will be given to only a small number whom God has predestined to be saved out of the vast number who are eternally lost.

Being more a matter of theology than philosophy, it can be tempting for those interested in Augustine as a philosopher to turn away from his later thinking on the will, but one has to be careful in doing so. To begin with, the boundary between the philosophical and the theological is not as clear in Augustine as it is in later philosophers, and part of what makes Augustine such a fascinating thinker is his refusal to compartmentalize his thought in ways that are now taken for granted. Second, the development of Augustine's thinking on the will, as unsettling as the resulting moral landscape may be, does oblige one to confront questions about what a viable concept of the will should involve as well as questions about how to determine moral culpability in the face of external determination—questions that are as easy to overlook as they are difficult to address. Finally, Augustine's reflections on the will had considerable influence upon those who inherited his vast legacy and on his own account of how we are to understand the drama of human history.

8. History and Eschatology

It is an irony that the man who bequeathed a Neoplatonic world view to the West also gave us a way of conceptualizing human history that is at odds with some of its most basic contours. In the Greco-Roman world in general and in Neoplatonism in particular, the importance of history is largely in the cyclical patterns that forge the past, present, and future into a continuous whole, emphasizing what is repeated and common over what is idiosyncratic and unique. In Augustine, we find a conception of human history that in effect reverses this schema by providing a linear account which presents history as the dramatic unfolding of a morally decisive set of non-repeatable events.

For the present day reader, it is easy to overlook both the plausibility of the cyclical view and the sorts of considerations that might stand in the way of the linear model with which we have become more familiar. Not only are there the obvious patterns of the seasons and the regularities discernible in astronomical phenomena, but, at a deeper level, there is the indispensable role that regularity and the recognition of common features play in our efforts to make the world intelligible. Moreover, the emphasis upon the common-qua-universal is a conspicuous feature of the Greek philosophical tradition. Thus, it is also hardly surprising that we find Aristotle telling us that poetry is more philosophical than history because it is more clearly concerned with universals, whereas history tends to be more concerned with particulars [Aristotle, Poetics 9.1451b1–7]; nor is it surprising that Thucydides presents his account of the Peloponnesian War as providing a pattern of events that will be repeated in the future [Thucydides, History of the Peloponnesian War, I.22]; or that Plutarch recounts past lives in a manner clearly designed to draw the reader's attention to patterns of virtue and vice rather than to faithfully recount particular facts [see, e.g. Plutarch, Life of Pericles 1.1–2]; or, for that matter, that Augustine himself would tell the tale of his first thirty-two years in the way that he does, more concerned to capture the Neoplatonic drama of the soul's immersion and extraction from the sensible/physical world than with providing a factual account of dates, names, and places.

Approached from this angle, what wants an explanation is why one would subordinate indispensable patterns and regularities in order to emphasize what is idiosyncratic and unique . Here, as in the case of the will, it is important to understand that Augustine is bringing together two quite disparate traditions, and here again one needs to take note of his efforts to capture the data of revelation he sees embedded in Judeo-Christian scripture. If one approaches these latter texts as presenting a Christian drama of the soul's salvation, one cannot help but focus upon the unique, non-repeatable events that define the drama, e.g., the fall recounted in the early chapters of Genesis, the incarnation, passion, and resurrection of Christ in the synoptic and Johannine gospels, and the final judgement foretold in Revelations. One must, however, exercise some caution here. The cyclical and linear approaches are matters of emphasis rather than mutually exclusive alternatives, and the scriptural traditions upon which Augustine relies are certainly not devoid of cyclical motifs [e.g. Ecclesiastes 3.1–8], nor does Augustine himself embrace one approach wholly to the exclusion of the other, as even a cursory reading of his Confessions reveals. And, of course, the historically unique life of Christ becomes a pattern for the Christian life in general [e.g. De Civitate Dei XXII.5]. These points notwithstanding, there can be little question that Augustine provides an account of human history that is at times resolutely linear, a tendency which can be traced to the Judeo-Christian scriptural tradition.

Already in De Magistro (389 C.E.) Augustine is keenly aware that much of what we need to believe falls outside the austere standards of his Platonic conception of knowledge and understanding. Among the most prominent of these are beliefs based on scripture [De Magistro 11.37; cf.12.39]. In the Confessions as well, even when Augustine is especially laudatory of the Platonists, he is emphatic that there is much that these books leave out. They cannot, for example, speak about those historical truths definitive to the Christian view of redemption through the incarnation and passion of Christ [Confessions VII.ix.13–14; see Bittner 1999, pg. 346]. Augustine is acutely aware that scripture has an historical dimension, and he is sensitive as well to the tensions between the scriptural tradition and the Neoplatonic framework upon which he is relying, a tension that comes to eclipse much of the intellectualistic optimism we find in his earliest completed post-conversion works, e.g. the Contra Academicos of 386 C.E. [see Contra Academicos 3.20.43 and “Context” above].

As we have seen, Augustine's increasing familiarity with the contents of scripture leads him to focus more and more upon the historical dimension of this tradition, a dimension alien to the intellectualism of the books of the Platonists. We have already seen this development reflected in his interest in the fall and the subsequent necessity of grace set forth in the Ad Simplicianum of 396 C.E. But it is in Augustine's sprawling City of God [De Civitate Dei, 413–427 C.E.] that one finds his most extensive and focused treatment of human history [see Rist 1994, pp. 203–255]. It is important to bear in mind, however, that Augustine does not provide a philosophy of history of the sort that one might find in a Vico, Hegel, or Marx; his concern is not with articulating a notion of history that views its progress as intelligible, or that sees it as developing according to immanent processes that are themselves accessible and worthy of study. Human history, for Augustine, is subsumed by the larger context of an eschatology wherein history is the temporal playing out of a divine justice in which the end is as fixed as the beginning [see Bittner 1999, pg. 348]. While it is not for us to know all the details of the plot or its conclusion [De Civitate Dei XX.2], we can nonetheless discern the general direction of the drama, as well as the juridical nature of the conclusion at which aims.

The drama is, for the most part, a hauntingly somber one. Due to the universal contagion of original sin wherein all have sinned in Adam, humanity has become a mass of the deservedly damned [De Civitate Dei XXI.12] who have turned away from God and towards the rule of self [see De Civitate Dei XIII.14; XIV.3 & 13]. By means of an utterly unmerited grace, God has chosen a small minority out of this mass—the smallness of the number is itself a means whereby God makes apparent what all in fact deserve [De Civitate Dei XXI.12]—and thus human history is composed of the progress of two cities, the city of God and the city of Man [e.g. De Civitate Dei XIV.28; XV.1 & 21; see Cranz 1972]: those who by means of grace renounce the self and turn towards God, as opposed to the vast majority who have renounced God and turned towards the self [De Civitate Dei XIV.28]. In this life, we can never be sure of which individuals belong to which city [e.g. De Civitate Dei XX.27], and thus they are intermingled in a way that thwarts any moral complacency. While the visible church bears a special relation to the city of God, membership in the Church is no guarantee of salvation [e.g. De Civitate Dei XX.9], and the history that is visible to us is merely a vestige of the moral drama that takes place behind the scenes, defying the scrutiny of our weak and often presumptuous reason [De Civitate Dei XX.21 & 22]. What is certain is that the linear movement of human history aims at the eventual separation of the two cities [e.g. De Civitate Dei XX.21 & 28], in which the members of each city are united with their resurrected bodies [e.g De Civitate Dei XXI.1 & 3 and XXII.21] and given their respective just rewards: for the small minority saved by unmerited grace, there is the vision of God, a joy we can only dimly discern at the moment [De Civitate Dei XXII.29]. For the overwhelming mass of humanity, there is the second death wherein their resurrected bodies will be subject to eternal torment by flames that will inflict pain without consuming the body [De Civitate Dei XXI.2–4], the degree of torment proportional to the extent of sin [De Civitate Dei XXI.16], although the duration is equal in all cases: they must suffer without end, for to suffer any less would be to contradict scripture and undermine our confidence in the eternal blessedness of the small number God has saved [De Civitate Dei XXI.23].

In De Civitate Dei as in the earlier Contra Academicos, Augustine is a eudaimonist who enjoins us to seek a happiness understood in terms of our objective relation to an hierarchical structure [e.g. De Civitate Dei XIV.25 and XX.21], and he still invokes philosophy, rightly understood, as an instrument that can help us move towards this end [De Civitate Dei XXII.22]. Moreover, he still views the world we experience as only a small part of reality, and here too Augustine sees our earthly lives as perfected in a realm that is outside the flux of history as we know and experience it [De Civitate Dei XXI.26]. Much, however, has obviously changed. Gone is the confidence that the “harbor of philosophy” [e.g. Contra Academicos 2.1.1] is the haven wherein we can find the rest that we seek, and gone is the idea that the rational life will lead us to our eudaimonistic end; gone as well is the breathless excitement with which Augustine would enjoin others to pursue the life of rational enquiry [e.g. Contra Academicos 2.2.5]. In place of all this is a moral landscape that seems even sadder and more unsettling than the sense of loss it was originally intended to relieve. And yet, even at the very end of De Civitate Dei, Augustine makes clear that he still regards this as a landscape which holds out the prospect of an incomparable vision and rest from all anxiety, a renewed condition that defies all mortal estimation [De Civitate Dei XXII.30; see also XX.21]. Now the aging Bishop of Hippo, Augustine still shows a trait he first exhibited as a youthful convert at Cassiciacum: a keen sense of the moral darkness that surrounds us and a philosophical penchant for the unexpected turn of thought by which he would have us escape it.

9. Legacy

In the long and difficult controversy with the Pelagians, Augustine found his own earlier writings on the will cited by his opponents as evidence that he himself once advocated the view he came so vehemently to oppose [see Retractationes I.9.3–6]. What is more, he dies just as the Vandals are besieging the gates of Hippo, leaving unfinished yet another work against Julian of Eclanum, a Pelagian opponent of considerable intellectual resources who had, among other things, accused Augustine of holding views indistinguishable from those of the Manicheans whom Augustine had opposed so many years before [Bonner, 1999]. And here, perhaps, is an irony as cruel as it is intriguing: eleven centuries later, when the Church to which Augustine had devoted the last four and a half decades of his life was to split in a manner that still shows no signs of reconciliation, both sides would appeal to Augustine as an authority on questions of doctrine [Muller 1999; Grossi 1999].

Leaving aside the relative merits of these accusations and appeals, their mere existence is only possible because of the diversity and astonishing range of Augustine's thought over the course of his lifetime. Augustine's movement from a largely Hellenistic eudaimonism to the increasingly somber eschatology of his later works is much more than a mere shift of position. It is the emergent product of a mind continually immersed in controversy and ever obliged to rethink old positions in light of new exigencies, obliged to turn yet again the stone turned so many times before.

First and foremost in Augustine's legacy is the voluminous body of work that encompasses this movement, revealing a range of thought only a handful of philosophers have managed to achieve. The diversity contained in this body of work defies any easy or succinct synopsis, and anyone who approaches it will find a range of ideas that can alternately intrigue, surprise, and sometimes even disarm and shock. One will also find a range of genres and styles, ranging from texts crafted with great rhetorical subtlety to texts that seem to “jangle” with the “music” [O'Connell 1987, pg. 203] of one who is thinking aloud as he writes. For those who want arguments and evidential support, it is there to be had, sometimes in repetitive abundance; for those sensitive to and appreciative of the power of poetic imagery, that too is abundantly in place. Indeed, as Robert O'Connell says, “Augustine constructed more through a play of his teeming imagination than by the highly abstract processes of strict metaphysical thinking” [O'Connell 1986, pg. 3].

But if that vast, multifaceted corpus is the basis of Augustine's legacy, it is also the ultimate obstacle to any attempt at neatly packaging or compartmentalizing it within some “ism” that can be neatly taxonomized. This is, of course, true of most major philosophers, but it seems incontestably true of Augustine. In place of tidy boundaries, there is instead the “jangle” of the corpus itself and the enormous influence it comes to have. This influence is to be found, for example, throughout early medieval philosophy (e.g. Boethius and John Scotus Eriugena), and in Anselm of Canterbury, including in what later came to be known as the ontological argument [Proslogion, Chapters I–IV]. Augustine's influence is plainly discernible in Bonaventure [e.g. Itinerarium Mentis in Deum] and others in the thirteenth century who sought an alternative to the Aristotelianism then gaining currency (e.g. John Peckham and Henry of Ghent). Even Thomas Aquinas, a pivotal figure in the rise of Aristotelianism, takes care to address and to accommodate Augustine's view on illumination among many other issues. In the modern period, the echoes in Descartes are conspicuous, both in the cogito [Matthews 1992] and elsewhere [Matthews 1999b]. And, of course, few philosophers have invoked Augustine as explicitly and as frequently as Malebranche [see, e.g. “Preface” to The Search After Truth]. More recently, one of the most influential works of twentieth century philosophy, Wittgenstein's Philosophical Investigations, opens with a lengthy quotation from Augustine's Confessions and a discussion of the picture of language that Wittgenstein sees invoked in it [Wittgenstein, Philosophical Investigations, Part I, pars 1–3 & 32]. And if this selective historical sampling were not enough, there is an enormous body of secondary literature devoted to Augustine ranging across disciplinary boundaries and across divisions within the philosophical community itself. In 1999 alone, there appeared, among numerous other works, a 900 page encyclopedia devoted to Augustine as a religious and philosophical figure [Fitzgerald, 1999] and a volume of essays by several prominent philosophers in the analytic tradition exploring Augustine's relation to a variety of topics including consequentialism, Kantian moral philosophy, and just war theory (an important issue which unfortunately falls outside the scope of the present discussion) [Matthews 1999]. If one examines the diverse interests of those influenced by Augustine together with the enormous body of secondary literature on Augustine, one finds again what one cannot fail to discern in the Augustinian corpus itself: a diversity as amazing as it is broad, one that defies any attempt at neat summary or tidy explication, a diversity as rich as it is discordant. It is unlikely that this is the legacy that Augustine would have wanted to leave behind, but it is a legacy of a sort that only a handful of philosophers have managed to achieve. The obvious irony notwithstanding, the discordance and diversity are both measures of, and testimony to, an intellectual depth and range seldom equaled in the history of western philosophy.

Bibliography

Selected Latin Texts and Critical Editions

The most common and most complete (but uncritical) edition of Augustine in Latin is the seventeenth century Maurist edition of Augustine's Opera Omnia which is reprinted in volumes 32–47 of J.P. Migne's Patrologiae Cursus Completus, Series Latina (Paris 1844–64), referred to below as PL. More critical texts are gradually emerging in four main series:

Given the voluminous number of Augustine's texts, the following list is confined to those especially relevant to the present article. In what follows, the Migne volume [PL] will be provided as well as those of any of the other above editions that have appeared. For information on Augustine texts not listed here, the reader is referred to Fitzgerald 1999, pp. xxxv–xlii, and the reader can also feel free to contact the author via the email address listed at the end of this article.

Selected English Translations

The following list is of standard and available English translations of the works cited above. Again, there is no attempt to be exhaustive, and readers seeking information for titles not listed should consult the relevant entry in Fitzgerald 1999 or contact the author via the email address at the end of this article.

Selected General Studies

The following is a list of works that can be helpful as introductions, guides, or general studies of Augustine's thought. The list represents a variety of viewpoints and approaches to Augustine, but it makes no attempt at being exhaustive. Interested readers should also consult Markus 1967 in “Select Secondary Works” below. The author welcomes suggestions for further additions.

Selected Secondary Works

The following provides a list of works relevant to topics covered in the present article, and most of the works listed are referred to at some point in the body of the article. The author welcomes suggestions for further additions. Interested readers should also note that there is an annual bibliographical survey of literature on Augustine in the Revue des Etudes Augustininnes.

Other Internet Resources

Related Entries

divine: illumination | medieval philosophy | Neoplatonism | Plotinus | political philosophy: medieval | skepticism: ancient | skepticism: medieval