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Tibetan Epistemology and Philosophy of Language

First published Wed Feb 2, 2011

The birth of the Tibetan epistemological tradition (Tib. tshad ma) follows the reception in Tibet of the central works on the subject by the Indian Buddhist forefathers, principally Dharmakīrti and his commentators. Tibetan epistemology evolved to a large extent in the framework of a commentarial tradition, which did not prevent it from developing into an indigenous system with its specific terminology and formal features, a system that involves issues that add to the themes inherited from the Indian tradition, at the core of which is the discussion on “reliable cognition” (Skt. pramāṇa, Tib. tshad ma). The present entry focuses on questions linked with the theory of knowledge and the philosophy of language, but the scope of Tibetan epistemological works extends also to the domain of logic and argumentation and involves, as Indian epistemological treatises do, discussions that relate to religiously oriented themes, such as the question of scriptural reliability, omniscience, etc.

The currently available works, written in Tibetan, range from the 11th c. to the present days. This abundant literature has for the most part not been studied outside the Tibetan framework of monastic studies; the majority of works has never been edited, only a few are translated, sometimes only partially.

The Tibetan tradition is by no means monolithic. Although Tibetan epistemologists address common themes of inquiry and can in part be situated within lineages sharing tendencies of interpretation, the individual compositions reveal a diversity that would make any attempt at grouping them into rigid categories prone to oversimplification.

Individual entries will hopefully be devoted to the respective thinkers in the future. This article will merely scratch the surface of this rich tradition by sketching out some key topics of inquiry and conflicting models representative of mainstream interpretative orientations.

1. Periodization

Attempts at periodizing the Tibetan tradition of epistemology rely on the one hand on the Indian sources taken as focus of interpretation by Tibetan scholars (Dharmakīrti's Pramāṇaviniścaya or his Pramāṇavārttika), on the other on the type of scholarly activity involved (translation, composition of commentary or of independent treatises).

Following van der Kuijp (1989) one can distinguish: (i) the ancient period, corresponding to the time of the First Diffusion of Buddhism in Tibet (8th c.), marked mainly by the translation of some Indian treatises on the subject; (ii) the pre-classical period, starting with the Later Diffusion of Buddhism in Tibet in the late 10th c., in which scholars focused on the translation of and commentaries on Dharmakīrti's Pramāṇaviniścaya and started composing independent works—typical of this period are the so-called Summaries of epistemology (tshad maʼi bsdus pa); (iii) the classical period, starting with Sakya Paṇḍita Kün-ga-gyay-tsen (Sa skya Paṇḍita Kun dgaʼ rgyal mtshan, 1182–1251), where the focus shifts to Dharmakīrti's Pramāṇavārttika; (iv) a post-classical period starting in the 15th c. characterized by a reappraisal of ideas developed in the pre-classical period, criticism of Sakya Paṇḍita's work and, respectively, defense of the latter.

The pre-classical period is marked by the lineage of epistemology initiated by Ngok Lo-den-shay-rab (rNgog Blo ldan shes rab, 1059–1109) at the Ga-dam-ba (bKaʼ gdams pa) monastery of Sang-pu-ne-u-tok (gSang phu Neʼu thog). Ngok himself and his successors, among whom Cha-ba Chö-gyi-seng-gay (Phya pa Chos kyi seng ge, 1109–1169) and Tsang-nak-pa Tsön-drü-seng-gay (gTsang nag pa brTson ʼgrus seng ge, ?–after 1195) are major influential figures, represented the mainline interpretative stream up to the 13th century, when Sakya Paṇḍita, advancing the need to treat the Indian sources more faithfully and more exhaustively, embarked on a generalized critique of his predecessors and contemporaries. Many features of the dividing line thus set by Sakya Paṇḍita remain points of dissent between authors whose lineage goes back to this author (this includes thinkers such as Go-ram-ba Sö-nam-seng-gay [Go rams pa bSod nams seng ge, 1429–1489] and Say-dok Paṇ-chen Śākya Chok-den [gSer mdog paṇ chen Śākya mchog ldan, 1428–1508]) and authors belonging to the Ga-den-ba (dGaʼ ldan pa) and subsequent Ge-luk (dGe lugs) traditions (both referred to as “Ge-luk” here for simplicity's sake). While the latter prolonged, to some extent, ideas found in the early Ga-dam-ba manuals, one should however avoid hasty claims of continuity. Representative for the Ge-luk tradition are the works of Tsong-ka-ba Lobsang-drak-ba (Tsong kha pa Blo bzang grags pa (1357–1419)'s disciples—Kay-drub-jay Gelek-pel-sang (mKhas grub rje dGe legs dpal bzang, 1385–1438), Gyel-tsap-jay Dar-ma-rin-chen (rGyal tshab rje Dar ma rin chen, 1364–1432), Ge-dün-drup (dGe ʼdun grub, 1391–1474)—and the manuals known as “Collected topics” (bsdus grwa), of which the oldest available instance is the Rwa stod bsdus grwa composed by Jam-yang Chok-hla-ö-ser (ʼJam dbyangs mChog lha ʼod zer, 1429–1500).

2. Epistemology

The examination of “reliable cognition” (tshad ma) is the core subject of Tibetan epistemological works. It is subsumed under the broader enterprise of classification of “mind” or “mental events” (Tib. blo) and involves the determination of the objects which the respective cognitions bear on.

2.1 Objects

2.1.1 Ontological framework

a. The scope of reality

Tibetan epistemologists are primarily Buddhist thinkers who follow the Madhyamaka views. A pertinent question for them is whether cognitions of the kind dealt with in epistemological works, namely, the so-called “reliable cognitions,” bear on objects pertaining to conventional reality and/or ultimate reality.

While some authors seek to include knowledge of the ultimate within the scope of reliable cognitions, the view of the majority is that reliable cognitions concern the conventional realm. The definition of an ontological position in epistemological works thus concerns conventional reality; the ultimate is beyond the reach of reasoning. Tibetan authors define their position—in some cases a provisional one adopted as a mere interpretative tool for dealing with Dharmakīrti's texts—on the basis of models associated with Indian Buddhist schools. Among the options are: an idealist model (Vijñānavāda) and two external-realist models. The last two agree in positing the existence of extra-mental entities, but differ in their account of the way that a cognition of such objects takes place; these are associated with the Vaibhāṣika and the Sautrāntika schools respectively. According to the first, extra-mental entities exist simultaneously to their cognition and are cognized directly by the latter. According to the second, extra-mental entities are the cause of their cognition but, being momentary, they have ceased to exist at the time cognition arises.

Early treatises attest to various choices among these models. For instance, Cha-ba refutes the idealist and the Sautrāntika external-realist models and settles for a Vaibhāṣika-like position, whereas Chu-mik-ba Seng-gay-pel (Chu mig pa Seng ge dpal, 13th c.) opts for an idealist framework. Sakya Paṇḍita's position, shared by Ge-luk authors, is to arrange these positions along a gradual ascending scale; the lowest, the Vaibhāṣika model is refuted in favor of the adoption of the Sautrāntika model, which is itself replaced by an idealist one on a higher scale of analysis.

b. The extension of the real

While real particulars (what Dharmakīrti calls “svalakṣaṇa”), characterized by their capacity to bring about an effect, are allotted conventional existence, Tibetan scholars are divided as to the spatial and temporal extensions of such particulars.

The spatial options range from an infinitesimal particle (the atom being considered the smallest size unit) to a macroscopic object up to a commonsense object; the temporal ones from a momentary entity to a continuum of indeterminate (although not infinite) duration. The adoption of extended objects is subject to the criticism brought forward by Dharmakīrti against Indian philosophers who admit wholes as distinct from their parts, and would, in a general way, conflict with the Buddhist idea that compounds only have nominal existence. On the other hand, the infinitesimalist view has difficulties to account for the fact that macroscopic objects appear to our cognition rather than individual atoms. The latter difficulty leads, in Dharmakīrti's works, to the refutation of extra-mental reality in favor of an idealist position. An intermediate view is to grant reality to objects that have some spatial extension: not commonsense objects, but aggregations of atoms within the scope of a specific sense-sphere (Skt. āyatana, Tib. skye mched), such as, for the visual sense-sphere, patches of color.

Regarding the temporal extension of real particulars, momentary entities pose a challenge to transactional usage: once known, they have already ceased and hence cannot be used nor acted upon. Transactional usage is better grounded in objects that have some duration. Continua, however, bring about the same critique as macroscopic objects: what really exists is a particular at each moment, but the chain of causally related moments, even though it may appear to the ignorant mind as an object having duration, only exists nominally. A limited temporal extension is not an option, for, in difference to aggregated atoms, the different moments in a series do not co-exist—only the present one exists and is causally efficient; they hence cannot be considered to contribute collectively to the cognition of an object.

Few Tibetan authors, among them Tak-tsang Lo-tsa-wa Shay-rap-rin-chen (sTag tshang Lo tsā ba Shes rab rin chen, b. 1405), adopt the infinitesimal-momentary view. The intermediate view is prescribed by Sakya Paṇḍita and adopted, for instance, by Lo-wo-ken-chen Sö-nam-lhün-drup (Glo bo mkhan chen bSod nams lhun grub, 1456–1532), while Ge-luk authors and some Sakya ones such as Ngak-wang-chö-drak (Ngag dbang chos grags, 1572–1641) extend their view of reality to commonsense objects and continua, which are held to possess their own causal capacity. They are described as collections, but distinguished from the partless wholes distinct from their parts advocated by the more extreme realist Indian philosophers which are the target of Dharmakīrti's criticism.

2.1.2 Typologies

Objects (Tib. yul) are primarily considered in relation to cognition (Tib. blo). In the common vocabulary of Tibetan epistemology, several sorts of objects are distinguished:

  1. the “appearing object” (snang yul)
  2. the “grasped object” or “apprehended object” (gzung yul)
  3. the “object of determination” or “conceived object” (zhen yul)
  4. the “object of application” (ʼjug yul)

While the terminology, which reflects different kinds of mental operations, is shared among Tibetan epistemologists, they disagree in their definitions of each sort and on the equivalence of some of them, in particular of the appearing object and the grasped object.

a. The appearing and grasped objects

Regarding the appearing object and the grasped object, a major cause of dissention lies in the model adopted to account for the process of a cognition of an object. Two options are in competition: (i) direct realism (associated with the Vaibhāṣika model) advocates a direct contact with reality; in this model the object and its cognition exist simultaneously, albeit distinctly; (ii) a causal theory (associated with the Sautrāntika model) according to which an object acts as a cause for the emergence of its cognition but, being momentary, has ceased to exist once this cognition arises.

(i) For an adherent of the first model such as Cha-ba, the appearing object, the object that manifests itself in cognition, and the grasped object, what cognition apprehends, are one and the same thing. Each cognition has its appearing object, and a threefold typology of mind is established on the basis of three sorts of appearing objects: the particular, the hallucinated object (i.e., something that appears while being inexistent) and the concept (don spyi). These three are distinguished and paired with three sorts of mental events by relying on two corresponding sets of criteria: (a) The characteristic of existence (associated with the notion of causal efficacy) separates real entities on the one hand and concepts and hallucinated objects on the other; it matches the identification of the corresponding mental events as “correct” and “erroneous” respectively. (b) The characteristic of vividness, associated with that of specificity, separates real entities and hallucinated objects from concepts, and is the ground for the distinction between non-conceptual and conceptual mental events. The correspondence plays out as follows:

object cognition
vividly appearing
specific
causally efficient		 particular non-conceptual
correct		 perception
vividly appearing
specific
not causally efficient		 hallucinated object
(lit. “vividly appearing non-existent”)		 non-conceptual
erroneous		 pseudo-perception,
e.g., dream or hallucination
not vividly appearing
not specific
not causally efficient		 concept (don spyi) conceptual
(erroneous by its very nature)		 any conceptual cognition

(ii) For an adherent of the causal model such as Sakya Paṇḍita, a mental event for the arising of which no real entity acted as a direct cause must be held to have, strictly speaking, no object, or at least, no “grasped object” (gzung yul). In other words, only non-conceptual correct cognitions (namely, perceptions) have a grasped object.

The causation-model further has the consequence that the grasped object cannot be identical with the appearing object: the grasped object has ceased at the time of the arising of its effect, a cognition in which an object manifests itself. Additionally, Sakya Paṇḍita understands “appearance” in the restricted sense of the mode of operation proper to non-conceptual cognitions. There can be no “appearance” in the case of a conceptual cognition, for the latter does not apply to reality by way of an appearance reflecting real objects, but by way of exclusion, namely by determinations that consist in eliminations of the opposite. Thus, according to Sakya Paṇḍita, the distinction between non-conceptual and conceptual amounts to a difference in the mode of operation of the respective cognitions, namely, via appearance (or vivid appearance) for the first, via exclusion for the second, while the distinction between correct and incorrect relies on the existence of a grasped object, namely, of a real object causing this cognition.

Adherents of the first model are thus criticized by those of the second for admitting improper, non-existent grasped object (namely, the concept and the hallucinated object), and for blurring the difference between the respective modes of operation of non-conceptual and conceptual cognitions. In return, the second model is criticized in that it does not enable direct access to real objects; those can, at best, be inferred.

Although later Ge-luk authors, who take causality and the time-gap problem it involves seriously, adopt the causation model, they mostly preserve Cha-ba's typology, together with the identification of grasped object and appearing object. This leaves them in a difficult situation as they adopt a typology of objects whose goal was precisely to avoid a model in which the object grasped by cognition would be different from the object that appears to it. Their solution is to invoke the notion of “aspect”: a cognition caused by an object takes a form similar to its cause. This aspectualism differs from a representationalist view in that it does not involve, strictly speaking, a representation which would stand as a curtain between cognition and the object. Cognition still cognizes its object directly by taking its aspect.

b. The conceived object

While “appearance” is passive, the “conceived object” is associated with an intentional operation of determination (zhen pa) that involves the (involuntary) blurring of the distinction between the mental appearance and an extra-mental particular by way of an unconscious error inherent to the thought process of ordinary beings. Such operation is restricted to conceptual cognitions, and is what allows action based on concepts.

c. The object of application

The “object of application” is usually identified with the object of reliable cognition, and hence understood differently according to the definition of reliable cognition adopted by each author. In some versions, the “object of application” stands out as a real, extra-mental particular considered to be the object that is likely to be acted upon at the outcome of a reliable cognition (for instance, a fire when perceiving a fire or when inferring that there is a fire on a hill as one perceives smoke on a hill). According to other authors, such as Cha-ba, the object of application is the “object with regard to which opposite superimpositions have been eliminated,” without reference to any transactional “application.”

One can identify, at the source of this typology, the need to specify the scope of reliability for reliable cognitions, an issue already dealt with by Dharmottara, who paved the way for the typology of objects developed in Tibet. A problematic case is that of inference: inference qualifies as a reliable cognition, but it is strictly speaking “erroneous” due to its conceptual nature. Namely, the thought-content of an inferential mental event is a universal, which bears no correspondence whatsoever with extra-mental reality. Nevertheless, inference is held to be “reliable,” and its reliability to have reality for its scope. This difficulty resolves itself when distinguishing between the apprehended object and the object of application (one could say, between the object from the point of view of the “input” and from the point of view of the “output”): inference is erroneous with regard to its grasped object (for those that admit that it has one), or just erroneous qua conceptual thought; on the other hand, inference is reliable with regard to its object of application—it give us a potential access to a real particular. The object of application is thereby identified as being the “object of reliable cognition.”

2.2 Cognitions

Typical of Tibetan epistemology is the classification of mental events, which gives rise to the specialized literature of “Lo-rik” (blo rigs), “types of mental events.” The typologies adopted depend on the authors' respective views on objects, the model adopted to account for their cognition, and the definition of reliable cognition.

The threefold typology met with above, which distinguishes between conceptual and non-conceptual mental events, and—among the latter—between correct and incorrect ones, is generally accepted, but not its correspondence with a three-fold typology of appearing objects.

More fundamental in view of the focus of epistemological works is the distinction between reliable and non-reliable cognitions. There is agreement as to which cognitions are reliable cognitions—precisely those prescribed by Dharmakīrti, namely, perception and inference—although not as to what defines them as reliable cognitions. As for non-reliable cognitions, one finds an opposition between a fivefold typology, which is the trademark of the Sang-pu school, and a more basic threefold typology prescribed by Sakya Paṇḍita. As the five cases of non-reliable cognitions (tshad min) are for the most part better explained as failures to fulfill one or more requirements of a reliable cognition, this opposition will be dealt with after the section on reliable cognition.

2.2.1 Reliable cognition (tshad ma)

Following Dharmakīrti, Tibetan epistemologists restrict the number of reliable cognitions to two sorts: perception and inference. The first is defined as “non-erroneous and devoid of conceptualization,” the second as the “understanding coming from a triply characterized logical reason.” Both share the status of being “reliable cognitions” (tshad ma), a status that Dharmakīrti defined in his Pramāṇavārttika with the characteristics of being (1) “non-belying” and (2) “revealing an unknown object.” In addition to a prolongation of the commentarial dispute on the verses in which these characteristics are given, a notable confrontation is found in the Tibetan tradition between two models that can be distinguished in view of the understanding of perception that they entail: (i) a model in which perception retains a passive status insofar as, being devoid of conceptualization, it cannot itself achieve a determination of its object, and (ii) a model that seeks to give a more active role to perception without however stepping back on its characterization as “non-conceptual.”

a. The “passive perception” model

The “passive perception” model can also be termed the “classic” model in that it claims to offer a more literal reading of Dharmakīrti. This model, adopted for instance by Sakya Paṇḍita, takes “non-belying,” combined with “novelty,” as definiens of reliable cognition. Without giving a pragmatic view of reliability, this model involves the capacity to fulfill a goal, or to have some causal efficacy, as a criterion for the non-belying character of cognition. Although being non-belying and novel is sufficient to qualify as reliable, in a transactional context, conventional reliable cognitions are expected to lead to an ascertainment (nges pa). While inference ascertains its object by itself, perception is unable to do so, because ascertainment—a conceptual operation, equivalent to the elimination of opposite superimpositions—is incompatible with its being “devoid of conceptualization.” Such an ascertainment, should it occur (this requires a number of circumstantial elements), must be performed by a conceptual cognition that follows perception. In other words, perception is reliable in itself, but has to rely on a subsequent conceptual mental event for ascertainment. This “two-tier” way of accounting for both reliability and determination keeps a strict division as to the role and capacity of non-conceptual and conceptual cognitions, which Sakya Paṇḍita compares respectively by way of illustration to “a seeing mute” and “a speaking blind.”

b. The “active perception” model

Some interpreters, already in India, were dissatisfied with this “passive” status of perception. The new model, which was first propounded by Cha-ba, brings revolutionary changes to the classic model, first by introducing in the definition of reliable cognition the notion of “elimination of opposite superimpositions,” then by claiming that perception itself (not a subsequent conceptual cognition) performs such a function.

Cha-ba formulates a new definition of reliable cognition in terms of the “understanding of a true object” (don bden rtogs). The object considered here is the “object of application,” and truth is explained as a correspondence to the status of reality supported by the absence of opposition. The long version of this definition brings to the fore elements that are systematized by later authors in a threefold list:

  1. novelty
  2. the mode of apprehension—to be reliable, a cognition must depend on its object in a way that it does not occur when the object is absent
  3. the elimination of opposite superimpositions.

In the later Ge-luk tradition, which draws on this model, the definition whose short version is formulated in terms of “newly non-belying” also includes the requirement of “eliminating superimpositions.”

In the Dharmakīrtian system, the “elimination of superimpositions” is tantamount to ascertainment (nges pa). This is to be understood in the framework of the so-called “apoha” (lit. “exclusion”) theory: any positive determination proceeds via the elimination of what is other. For instance, determining a patch of colour as “blue” does not consist in identifying some blue property or some blueness shared by blue things, but in differentiating this patch from the “other,” namely from things that are not-blue. Determination as “blue” amounts to eliminating actual superimpositions of “non-blue” (for instance, if one thought that the patch was yellow), or potential ones; in the former case, the determination eliminates an erroneous judgment and replaces it by a correct one, in the latter it prevents the subsequent arising of an erroneous judgment. Both sides of the process, superimposition and its elimination, are, for Dharmakīrti, exclusively conceptual operations.

According to Cha-ba, however, “elimination” is not limited to the kind of conceptual operation that follows a determination (zhen pa). Perception, although it does not perform any intentional determination, is however capable of eliminating superimpositions via a causal process: perception gives rise, at the next moment, to another non-conceptual mental event in which the potential of the wrong superimposition to arise has been neutralized, thus preventing its subsequent arising. Insofar as it, by this means, eliminates opposite superimpositions, perception is held to ascertain (nges pa) its object, without involving any conceptual element.

A further specificity worth noting is that the “elimination of opposite superimpositions” can bear on an object which is not the appearing object. For instance, a perception which has a patch of blue as its appearing object can eliminate the superimposition “non-blue” and thereby ascertain “blue,” but it can also eliminate the superimposition “presence of a patch of yellow” and thereby ascertain “absence of a patch of yellow” even though the absence of yellow does not appear to this perception. The first process is termed “direct realization” (dngos rtogs), the second “indirect realization” (shugs rtogs).

The main criticism addressed by advocates of the “passive” model to the “active” model is that it attributes to perception an operation that is restricted to conceptual cognitions; in their view indeed, “elimination of superimpositions” amounts exclusively to the “exclusion of what is other,” the mode of operation of conceptual cognitions.

Another issue is the possibility to account for the non-ascertainment of some aspects of an appearing object (typically, its impermanence). Advocates of the “passive” model claim that all aspects appear to perception, but that a conceptual determination spontaneously arises subsequently only with regard to some aspects, according to the circumstances (nature of the aspect, competence and mindfulness of the cognizer, visibility, etc.). Advocates of the “active” model, they argue, would have to concede that if ascertainment relies merely on appearance, everything that appears should be ascertained. Actually, partisans of the “active” model invoke the same set of circumstances as their opponents to explain why not all superimpositions are eliminated by a perception even though there is no partial appearance of the object. In their case, however, since the elimination of superimposition is what characterizes a reliable cognition, they are led to admit that a perception, although being a single mental event, is both a reliable cognition with regard to some aspects of the appearing object and a non-reliable cognition with regard to other aspects. In opposition to the “passive” model in which every perception is reliable, this system thus leaves room for both “reliable perception” and “non-reliable perception,” and furthermore for mental events that are both reliable and non-reliable.

The adoption of the criteria of “eliminating superimpositions” in the definition of reliable cognition does not affect inference. Regarding inference, the divergences of interpretation concern the logical domain rather than the epistemological one. There are however different answers to the question how inference, being a conceptual process, can successfully relate to reality. This question will be dealt with in the section on universals.

As hinted at in the last discussion, the fundamental disagreement between advocates of the respective models with regard to perception and more generally with regard to the definition of reliable cognition has consequences for their understanding of non-reliable cognitions.

2.2.2. Non-reliable cognitions

a. Fivefold typology

Early Sang-pu scholars, by embedding the discussion of reliable cognition within a general examination of mental events, were led to develop a typology of non-reliable cognitions. This typology, which is mostly adopted in later Ge-luk textbooks, includes the following five types:

  1. Unascertained appearance (snang la ma nges pa). These are typically cases of non-conceptual cognitions that fail to eliminate opposite superimpositions with regard to their appearing object. This failure can result from a lack of attention, of wit, of familiarity, or can be due to the nature of an appearing aspect; the latter might be too “subtle.” Such cognitions do not qualify as reliable since an elimination of opposite superimpositions does not take place, but still qualify as perceptions insofar as they are non-erroneous and devoid of conceptualization.
  2. Redundant ascertainment (bcad paʼi yul can). Such cognition, either conceptual or non-conceptual, applies to an object with regard to which opposite superimpositions have already been eliminated. It thereby fails to fulfill the criterion of “novelty.”
  3. Presumption (yid dpyod). Such a conceptual cognition correctly ascertains an object, but not via a proper inferential process. Although it is novel and eliminates opposite superimposition, it does not qualify as reliable in view of its mode of apprehension. Indeed, presumption is held to entail truth, while still not depending on its object either via a relation of causality or identity.
  4. Error (log shes). A cognition can be erroneous from the point of view of its appearing object or of its conceived object. In both cases, the error consists in not apprehending—respectively, not conceiving—in concordance with reality. Any cognition in which something that is not real, i.e., not causally efficient, appears is “erroneous.” This includes perceptual errors such as hallucinations and dreams, as well as all conceptual cognitions since their appearing object is a concept, i.e., something that is merely superimposed. Determination (zhen pa) is in itself erroneous in that it confuses what is conceived and what is real. More restrictively, “erroneous with regard to the conceived object” indicates that a determination is faulty in that it does not relate to a state of affairs, for instance, if one determines sound as permanent whereas it is in reality impermanent.
  5. Doubt (the tshom). Doubt occurs when one fails to choose between two alternative possibilities, leaving both options open. According to Cha-ba, doubt is a conceptual cognition. Although an intentional operation of determination (zhen pa) occurs, doubt is opposed to ascertainment (nges pa) insofar as this determination does not bring about a conclusive ascertainment. What is eliminated is merely the impossibility of either option. This case thus appears as the conceptual pendent of unascertained appearance.
b. Threefold typology and critique of the fivefold typology

Opponents to the new definition of reliable cognition and the “active perception” model, starting with Sakya Paṇḍita, instead adopted a threefold typology of non-reliable cognitions: i. non-understanding (ma rtogs), ii. false cognition (log shes/log rtog) and iii. doubt (the tshom). These share as definiens the failure of being “non-belying” and can be ultimately reduced to the unique category of non-understanding.

The critique of the fivefold typology of non-reliable cognition relies first on the understanding of perception as a passive cognition which does not itself ascertain its object, but whose reliability is actually independent of this subsequent ascertainment.

The category of “unascertained appearance” is thus denied the status of independent category: according to proponents of the “passive perception” model, every perception is an unascertained appearance; ascertainment is always the deed of a subsequent conceptual cognition. There is thus no such thing as an “ascertained appearance” if what is implied is ascertainment by perception itself. Cases that are classified as “unascertained appearance” in the fivefold typology merely differ from other perceptions in that they are not immediately followed by the arising of an ascertaining conceptual cognition, but this does not affect their reliability.

Redundant cognition is also rejected as a distinct category. Redundant non-conceptual cognition is in particular held to be impossible. Indeed, any subsequent perception necessarily has a new object since the object of the previous perception, being a momentary particular, has already ceased to exist when the subsequent perception arises. More generally, a redundant cognition would have no cognitive role, for its object would not be something that is to be understood; it is accordingly judged to amount to non-understanding.

Cases of presumption are subsumed under the category of doubt. Doubt should not be understood here in the sense of “hesitation,” but as the lack of decisive ascertainment. Indeed, that the presumption is actually correct—which can only be ascertained extrinsically—does not amount to its constituting a decisive ascertainment. If no evidence at all is adduced, such “lucky guesses” are not worth any certitude, and if faulty evidence is adduced, they are to be interpreted as pseudo-inferences.

2.3 Universals

An important issue at the crossing of ontology and epistemology that also has consequences for the philosophy of language is that of universals. Two main trends can be distinguished among Tibetan authors: The first, which is termed below “antirealism,” is a literal interpretation of Dharmakīrti's thought denying reality to universals and properties. The second, which one can describe as “moderate realism,” holds that not all universals are non-existent. In particular, it concedes some reality to predicates, thereby granting reality to the universals that are their referents.

2.3.1 Antirealism

The antirealist position, held by Sakya Paṇḍita and his epigones, insists on the radical distinction between the conceptual domain and reality, between universals and particulars. Only particulars are real—the criterion for reality being causal efficiency. Universals are mere mental constructions; they are superimpositions that do not reflect reality, but veil the individuality of particulars under the cover of an imagined shared property. Conversely, the distinct properties that one ascribes to a particular are equally not part of the fabric of reality, but mental constructions that veil the unity of that particular.

The question of the why and the how of concept formation is dealt with within the framework of the theory of anyāpoha (“exclusion of the other,” Tib. gzhan sel) propounded by Dharmakīrti. According to Dharmakīrti, conceptual thought proceeds by applying distinctions among particulars in a way that reflects some subjective intention and beginningless habits acquired in countless past lives. One accordingly ends up grouping things by excluding them from other things. What is implied by the term “exclusion” is that what particulars apprehended under the cover of a universal have in common is merely that they are all excluded from a complementary domain. In short, what xs have in the common is that they are not non-xs. By subsuming a particular under an imagined universal, or by ascribing a property to it, mentally or verbally, one is not identifying a real feature of this object, but merely distinguishing it from other particulars.

Although universals and properties are conceptual constructions, we mistakenly identify them as something real. This mistaken conflation of the conceptual and reality that we spontaneously apply when forming or using concepts provides a bridge between the two domains, prompting practical action, interaction with reality, based on fictions. The success of such interaction is accounted for by the causation involved in the process of concept formation which guarantees an indirect link between universals and the particulars they are taken to stand for: concepts are formed as the result of experiences involving causally active particulars; however, only the individual causal capacities of particulars are involved, not any shared potential that would determine natural kinds. Thus, for instance, the universal “fire” is conceived following experiences of particulars that one excludes from other particulars that are held not to burn. By acting on the basis of the inference that there is “fire” on the hill when one perceives smoke on the hill, although the object of this inference is the universal “fire,” not a real fire, when one acts on the basis of this inference one obtains a particular that fulfills the expected function of burning, as the previously experienced particulars that one excluded from non-fire did.

2.3.2 Moderate realism

The Ge-luk tradition as well as some Sakya thinkers instead adopted a moderate realist position with regard to universals. Their argument is that if universals were not real, reasoning based on universals would not apply to reality. In other words, reasoning cannot lead to practical success by relying on mere fictions. Moderate realism thus presents itself as an attempt to account for the soundness of conceptual cognitions, and to do so in a way that is more intuitive than the antirealist model.

In Ge-luk textbooks, universals and specific instances are defined in terms of each other: a universal is something instantiated by its instances, the instances are what is subsumed by a kind, or universal. To qualify as an instance, three criteria must be satisfied, namely, x is a specific instance of y if

  1. x is y
  2. x has a relation of essential identity with y
  3. there are other instances of y different from x.

There is thus no intrinsic difference between particular and universal, those are relative notions. For instance, “pen” is a universal with regard to “red pen,” which is its particular (a red pen is a pen, and is essentially identical with pen, and there are other instances of pen, such as a blue pen, that are not a red pen). But “pen” is also a particular with regard to “impermanence,” and “red pen” is a universal with regard to “plastic red pen.”

Further, the instantiation of a universal by its specific instance is taken to be a relation that obtains in reality, rather than amounting to a constructed superimposition. The red pen really is a pen; it is not merely apprehended under the superimposed universal “pen” due to its being excluded from non-pen.

The relation between the instance and the universal is expressed by the formula “one nature and distinct exclusions” (or “distinct distinguishers for one nature,” Tib. ngo bo gcig la ldog pa tha dad). The term “exclusion” brings us back to the theory of apoha. When proponents of antirealism use this formula, they mean that various conceptual distinctions can be made with regard to a unique particular, by distinguishing it from various complementary domains; for instance, one can conceive of a particular as excluded from non-blue, from non-impermanent, from non-material, etc. For the moderate realist, however, this distinction is not a mere conceptual one, it extends to reality, although it does not entail a distinction pertaining to the substance. There are thus real properties that can be predicated, but they are not intrinsically distinct from their subject. If one accepts real predicates, then the universals that are the referents of the corresponding expressions must also be accepted.

Both models attempt to bridge the gap between universals and particulars by grounding universals in reality, the antirealist one by involving causality in the process of concept formation, the moderate realist one by implying a correspondence in reality to our conceptual distinctions. The second model, although it provides a more intuitively acceptable explanation, meets with difficulties. If taking conceptual divisions as actual divisions is not without tensions, the mere fact of positing real universals is problematic in the commentarial tradition of an antirealist author. A key move in this regard is to distinguish the idea of a universal qua mental construct, and a universal qua a phenomena common to several instances. In the second sense, a universal needs not be unreal.

Other models of moderate realism were developed in the Sakya tradition, that also invoke the necessity for the existence of a real shared property without which our thinking would be arbitrary. U-yuk-ba Rik-bay-seng-gay (ʼU yug pa Rigs paʼi seng ge, 13th c.), who adopts such a line of interpretation, explains Dharmakīrti's refutation of real universals as referring to a “mental universal,” the mistaken conflation of distinct things under a unitary appearance. His view of an “objective universal” involves the theory of apoha, in a way that takes the exclusion from non-x as a fact rather than as a mental construct.

Another Sakya author who adopts moderate realism is Po-dong Chok-lay-nam-gyal (Bo dong Phyogs las rnam rgyal, 1376–1451). He qualifies as a realist insofar as he distinguishes between universal qua construct and universal qua common phenomena, and accuses the antirealists of nihilism. He nonetheless criticizes other Tibetan versions of moderate realism, which he considers to be prone to Dharmakīrti's critique against real universals. His solution, akin to U-yuk-ba's, is to reformulate the universal negatively as a real elimination; a solution which, however, does not escape the faults he himself addressed against the positive version of real universals.

Moderate realism is traditionally ascribed to Cha-ba and the Sang-pu school in general. The earliest occurrence of explicit arguments in favor of real universals identified so far is in the works of Chu-mik-ba.

3. Philosophy of language

3.1 The object of words

Language is dealt with in Tibetan epistemological treatises in terms of the relationship between “what expresses” (rjod byed) and “what is expressed” (brjod bya)—two notions that come quite close to the Saussurian distinction between “signifier” and “signified.”

According to the basic presuppositions of Buddhist ontology, “words” consist in singular sound emissions uttered at a specific place and time, and the “objects” that are interacted with as a consequence of language use are momentary and unique particulars. Although words and objects appear to be what expresses and what is expressed, the success of language cannot rely on a relation between particular words and particular objects, for this would not provide the generalizability necessary for language to have any practical utility. Particular words express particular objects only in virtue of the conventional relation established, within a linguistic community, between generic words and meanings.

Accordingly, Tibetan models distinguish between (i) a “direct signifier” and a “directly signified”—a generic word (sgra spyi) and a generic object, identified as a “don spyi” (the term was previously translated as “concept” when discussing the appearing object of conceptual cognition)—and (ii) a “conceived signifier” and a “conceived signified,” the particular sound emission and the particular object.

direct signifier
(dngos kyi rjod byed = sgra spyi)		 directly signified
(dngos kyi brjod bya = don spyi/sgra don)
conceived signifier
(zhen paʼi rjod byed = sgra [rang gi mtshan nyid])		 conceived signified
(zhen paʼi brjod bya = don [rang gi mtshan nyid])

There are two main issues with this model, one is the relation between the direct signifier and signified and the conceived ones, the other is the understanding of what is the “directly signified.”

(a) The question of establishing relations between generic words and meaning whereas there exist, in reality, only particular sound utterances and objects, and of interaction with these particulars relying on generic words and meanings echo the issue already met with in the context of conceptual processes and actions relying on them, namely, bridging the gap between the conceptual realm and reality. The expression “conceived” (zhen pa) is here also indicative of a process of intentional determination that involves the mistaken identification of the conceptual fiction with extra-mental reality. Sakya Paṇḍita distinguishes the context of “explanation,” where one differentiates between “direct” and “conceived” signifier and signified, between generic and specific words and objects, and the context of “action,” that is, practical language use. In the context of “action”—this includes convention-setting and application of conventions—these differences are blurred for speakers and hearers. The double articulation of the conceptual and reality thus holds together thanks to spontaneous mistaken identifications that take place while learning and applying linguistic conventions.

The divergences discussed in the section on universals between antirealists and moderate realists are reflected when it comes to language: while antirealists hold that language, just like conceptual thought, merely deals with fictions, moderate realists argue that language captures real features of the world, even if only in a distorted fashion. They thereby admit real properties shared by discrete instances. These properties are (due to commentarial requirements) presented in negative terms, as “objective exclusions.” For later Ge-luk authors, the “not being non-x” (some authors do not bother with the double negation) shared by several instances is the main object of the convention, while the corresponding concept, the don spyi, is its secondary object.

For a justification of the success of language, antirealists can appeal to the theory of apoha and the explanation involving causality in concept formation. Indeed, words reflect conceptual distinctions that can also be understood as constructed universals; language can only occur within a system of concepts. In Dharmakīrti's system, which is here presupposed, words are associated via conventions not with an object, but with a “distinction” which requires a bipartition of particulars in two complementary domains. A word can be associated to this distinction of xs from non-xs at the time of an agreement. Subsequently, any use of an utterance that is a token of this word indicates nothing else than the elimination of non-xs, but can lead to obtain a particular excluded from non-xs. The causal process involved in the process of concept formation is what ensures success, provided that conventions are established and learned successfully.

(b) The identification of the “directly signified” prompts divergences among Tibetan scholars.

For most authors who accept that conceptual cognition has an appearing, or grasped object, this object (the don spyi) is also what is directly signified by a word. A word utterance triggers the emergence of such an appearing object in the mind of the hearer. The distinction between “direct” and “conceived” signified supports a distinction between sense and reference. Distinct words trigger the emergence of distinct “generic objects”—there are distinct “directly signified.” The corresponding “conceived signified” can be distinct as well (for instance for the emergence of the generic objects “pot” and “pillar”) or the same (for instance a particular blue pot is the conceived signified for both the generic objects “pot” and “blue”). Early Sang-pu authors contend that some distinct words—true synonyms—generate the apparition of the same generic object, thus parting with the ultra-intensionality that reigns in Dharmakīrti's system, where each word is ascribed a unique way of excluding something from what it is not.

Note that the generic object is not unanimously accepted as the signified even among authors that admit that it is the appearing object of conceptual thought. Chu-mik-ba for instance prescribes as signified “a generic object mixed with a generic word.” Accordingly, what appears in conceptual cognition upon hearing a particular word is a mixed aspect of the corresponding generic word and generic object. The extra-mental entity is obtained via an operation of determination pertaining to the generic object, which is the appearing object of conceptual thought.

That conceptual cognitions have an appearing object is not admitted by all Tibetan scholars, and, as seen above, is criticized in particular by Sakya Paṇḍita. The latter nevertheless adopts the same basic model, using for the “directly signified” the more Dharmakīrtian expression “verbal object” (Tib. sgra don, Skt. śabdārtha) alternatively to the expressions “generic object” (don spyi). However, the point of contention discussed in the context of the threefold typology of objects re-emerges, as this author insists that such a signifier actually does not exist (it is not a causally efficient particular) and is not even properly speaking an “object.” Sakya Paṇḍita adopts, phenomenologically speaking, a view that is quite similar to the one he criticizes: while his opponents speak of a “generic object appearing to conceptual thought,” Sakya Paṇḍita accepts that there is the emergence of an “image” or “reflection” (Tib. gzugs brnyan, Skt. pratibimba/pratibhā) in conceptual thought. But as far as meaning is concerned, Sakya Paṇḍita holds the more radical view that words actually do not signify anything: a word does not have any object, because nothing qualifies as such. One can speak, but only metaphorically, of the extra-mental particular as being “signified” insofar as it is what one obtains when acting upon the determination in which generic and specific, conceptual and real, are confused. This extra-mental particular alone can provide the basis for intersubjective agreement about the object of words. The generic object could not play this role: being private, it would in any case not be able to play any epistemic role.

This model is constructed as a way to bridge the gap between conceptual processes and reality, and, consequently, focuses on language use in transactional usage involving real entities. If the use of words expressing non-entities can be accounted for, it however turns out to be problematic, in a model where meaning is only acquired indirectly through a mistaken process of conflating a conceptual fiction and reality, to talk about abstract entities, such as first- or second-order properties. For instance, the word “red” could only acquire a meaning in the sense of a red particular, i.e., as “something red,” but not as the “property red.” As a consequence, heterological predicates are ruled out, for both the word for the subject and the word for the property are related to the same particular in the process of mistaken identification with an extra-mental entity. For instance, expressing the idea that “(the particular) sound is audible but (the property) audible is not audible” would be problematic if “audible” only means “what is audible.”

3.2 The theory of definition

A significant contribution of Tibetan epistemology which can be included within the philosophy of language is the discussion of definition and the related issue of predication. The specificity of the Tibetan theory of definition is that it takes into account not two elements—a definiens and a definiendum—but three elements—the definiens, the definiendum, and the definitional basis—along a model which bears many similarities with that of inference. “Defining” thus relies on the relation between the definiens and the definiendum, but actually consists in the establishment that some definiendum is fit to be applied to some definitional basis on account of the relevant definiens; for instance, that “John is fit to be called “man” because he is a rational animal,” or to take a more indigenous example, that “the white calf is fit to be called “cow” because it has a hump and a dewlap.”

Discussions on definition focus on the identification of the instances of each of the three elements (what can be a definiens, a definiendum, or a definitional basis) and on their respective definition, leading in particular to the question whether a definiens requires a definiens. Another issue is that of the nature of the distinction between the three elements.

The evaluation of a definition relies on three criteria that a correct definiens must fulfill: (i) the definiens applies to the definitional basis, (iii) the definiens can be understood without relying on an extrinsic motive, and (iii) the definiens has the same connotation and denotation as the definiendum.

The second requirement underlines a difference between the definiens and the definiendum, expressed in Tibetan in terms of the first being “substantially existent,” the second “nominally existent.” The latter thus depends on the understanding of something else—here the definiens. According to the third requirement, definiens and definiendum must be co-extensive, but only a single definiens provides the specific denotation of the definiendum. For instance, “causally efficient” is not the definiens of “impermanent” even though everything that is causally efficient is impermanent and vice-versa, because it is not held to be directly contradictory to “permanent,” the way “not remaining for a second moment” (the accepted definiens of “impermanent”) is.

Bibliography

A. Sources and translations

1. Pre-classical period

The available resources for the early period include the works by Ngok Lo-den-shay-rab, Cha-ba, Tsang-nak-ba, Tsur-tön Shön-nu-seng-gay (mTshur ston gZhon nu seng ge) and Chu-mik-ba, as well as an anonymous summary that dates to the time of Cha-ba. No translations are available apart from some passages analyzed in the studies mentioned under B.

2. Classical and post-classical period (selective list)

B. General modern studies

For an introduction to the pre-classical and classical period, see:

The most extensive general study of the classical and post-classical period is:

C. Specific modern studies

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Dharmakīrti | Indian Philosophy (Classical): epistemology | Indian Philosophy (Classical): language and testimony | Madhyamaka | properties | realism | reliabilism | Tsongkhapa