Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy
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Feminist Perspectives on Reproduction and the Family

First published Sat Nov 6, 2004; substantive revision Tue Jan 5, 2010

Historically, few of the philosophers who defended justice in the public political realm argued for just family structures. Instead, most viewed the family as a separate realm that needed to be protected from state intrusion. The private sphere and the public sphere were dichotomized into separate realms with the latter beyond the reach of public action. Where these philosophers did not legitimate private power in the family, they simply ignored it.

John Stuart Mill was a notable exception, arguing in The Subjection of Women, that the inequality of women in the family was incompatible with their equality in the wider social world. Consider, he asks, the consequences of “the self-worship, the unjust self preference” nourished in boys growing up in male dominated households in which “by the mere fact of being born male he is by right the superior of all and every one of an entire half of the human race” (1869, 86–87). How will such boys grow up into men who treat women as equals? Feminist scholarship has continued, extended and deepened this attack on the conception of the family as a private personal realm. Indeed, the idea that “the personal [that is, the family] is political” is the core idea of most contemporary feminism.

1. Why The Family is Subject to Principles of Justice

Feminists argue that the so-called private realms of family, sex and reproduction must be part of the political realm and thus subject to principles of justice for three distinct reasons:

  1. Families are not “natural” orderings, but social institutions backed up by laws. For example, marriage is a social institution. Therefore, the state cannot choose not to intervene in families: the only question is how it should intervene and on what basis.
  2. The state has a critical interest in the development of future citizens.
  3. The division of labor in traditional families constrains women's opportunities and freedoms in the wider society.

Let us consider each of these three arguments in turn.

1.1 The family is a political institution

Traditional views of the family often treat it as a pre-political or as a non-political institution. The family is viewed as pre-political by those that hold that its basis lies in certain facts of biology and psychology. The family is viewed as non-political by those who hold that the circumstances of politics — scarcity, conflict of interests and power — do not obtain in the family. Both of these assumptions are problematic and have been subject to feminist criticism.

1.1.1 Why the family is not pre-political

For many traditional theorists of the family, nature itself necessitates the division of tasks within the family. Women naturally want to have and raise children; men by nature do not (Rousseau 1762). There is thus a physiologically grounded basis of gender difference: women's predominant role in childrearing and domestic labor is their biological destiny.

Feminists have given three responses to this argument.

Social constructivists deny that there are any essential differences between male and female bodies or psychologies that explain women's position in the family. Social constructivists have explored the ways in which culture and society have shaped even the most ostensibly natural differences between men and women. They argue that many of the differences between men and women alleged to be the source of gender inequality should instead be viewed as the outcome of that inequality. For example, they claim that we cannot understand sex-based differentials of height and physical strength without considering the influence of diet, division of labor, and physical training. Feminist historians and anthropologists have sought to demonstrate the significant roles that culture, religion and social class have played in shaping women's lives (Scott 1988).

Difference feminists accept that there are essential biological or psychological differences between men and women. But they seek to challenge the normative and social implications of these differences. Even if women are by nature more nurturing than men, or more concerned with their relationships with others, the effects of these differences depend on how we value them (Gilligan 1982, Noddings 1986). If nurturing were a more valued activity, for example, then we might arrange the work world so that women (and men) could spend more time with their children. Or, we might pay women (and men) for their household labor and work in raising children. Difference feminists seek to celebrate and revalue those characteristics traditionally associated with women. On their view, there is no necessary problem with a sex-based division of labor, provided it is voluntary and that male and female roles are appropriately valued. This difference perspective is perhaps best summed up by the words of the familiar quip: women who want to be equal with men lack ambition.

An anti-subordination feminist perspective aims to dislodge questions about biological and psychological difference from the center of debates about the family and reproduction. A narrow focus on men and women's “difference” versus their “equality” obscures what is at stake in treating people as equals. Even if there are some natural differences between men and women, these differences do not justify social structures that leave women vulnerable to poverty, unequal pay for equal work, and domestic violence. Whatever the facts about women's biology or psychology, such differences do not entail women's social subordination (MacKinnon 1989, Rhode 1989). Biology does not explain coverture — the eighteenth century doctrine that assigned a wife's property and rights wholly to her husband — contemporary divorce law, child custody laws, or laws governing women's reproduction. Nothing in our nature dictates the structure of work and school hours that make it extremely difficult for anyone to combine work and raising children. Even if nature is part of the causal story of gender differences, it cannot by itself explain — or more importantly justify — the extent of the social inequality between men and women.

1.1.2 Why the family is not non-political

The fact that law already has permeated the family — as in the doctrine of coverture — is an important insight of contemporary feminism. Families have always been shaped by law — by coercion, as well as by social convention. For example, laws in the United States regulate who can marry, who has parental rights, who can divorce and on what terms, and who can inherit property. Almost all countries have laws that prevent gay couples from marrying and in many places from adopting children; in other countries daughters cannot inherit property at all with devastating consequences for their well-being. The family has, in fact, always been heavily regulated by the state, often in ways detrimental to women's equality (Fineman 1995).

Nevertheless, some political thinkers argue that law — particularly, the assignment of rights and obligations — are inappropriately applied within the family. While families may appropriately be regulated as a legal entity through marriage and divorce, these thinkers argue that the day-to-day interactions of families are based on different principles. Families are based on the ties of love and affection, not justice. The circumstances of justice — conflict of interests, power, and scarcity — do not belong in families, at least when they are functioning properly. These thinkers criticize the idea — which they associate with bringing justice into the family — that the task of washing the dishes should be allocated on principles of justice (Sandel 1982).

There is something to be said for an ideal of families as associations beyond justice whose participants think from a sense of their intertwined lives, of a common good. In Christopher Lasch's resonant phrase, such families can be a “haven in a heartless world”. But this view of the family is limited in certain crucial respects. First, many families, rather than based on love and consent are based on coercion. Real families are often characterized by disagreements, and in the extreme, by violence. In these families, the internalization of norms of justice would be an improvement. Second, even in loving families, women are made vulnerable by the unequal division of labor in the family, by assumptions about child-rearing and household responsibilities. While ideal families may go beyond justice in their relations to their members, it is still appropriate for citizens to reflect on the ways that domestic arrangements affect social justice and family life. Most of us are simultaneously members of families and members of a larger polity: there is no reason why a perspective based on harmonious affection cannot coexist with a perspective based on standards of justice (Okin 1989). Finally, given the existence of two complementary but diverse perspectives, there is no reason to think that citizens will seek to apply principles of justice to dishwashing.

Justice, however, must govern families not only because real families are far from ideal. The state also has an interest in promoting and maintaining just families because of the effects of families on future citizens and on women's opportunities and real freedoms.

1.2 The family affects the development of future citizens

Almost every person in our society starts life in a family of some kind. The kind of family one has influences the kind of person one grows up to be. In families, children first encounter concepts of right and wrong, as well as role models who shape their sense of what it is possible for them to do and be. Families are an important school of moral learning, but too many families teach inequality and subordination, not principles of justice. Following Mill, feminist scholars question how children whose first experiences of adult interaction are unequal altruism, domination and manipulation can learn and accept the principles of justice they need to be citizens in a democracy committed to the equal worth of all (Okin 1989).

Plato also recognized the importance of the family for the moral development of individuals. In Book V of the Republic, Socrates discovers that when theorists of justice take into account the effects of the family on the socialization of children, they will be forced to the conclusion that the family must be abolished. While few feminists follow Plato in proposing to abolish the family, almost all see the family as in need of reform.

Families are schools of moral learning, but they are more than that. Parents play an extremely large role in the lives of their dependent children. States need to regulate families to insure that all children are educated, are inoculated against contagious diseases and have their basic needs met. No state can be indifferent to whether or not children grow up to be literate, functioning members of its economy. All states thus depend, at least in part, on the labor of caretaking and childrearing, work that is today overwhelmingly done by women. Given its evident importance, why is domestic labor not given greater public recognition? Feminists have made a strong case for taking such care-giving within the family seriously, and for the state to attend to the justice issues involved in care provision (Kittay 1999). Feminists have also argued that just states must provide care in a way that ensures that all children — boys and girls, rich and poor — have equal opportunities to grow up able to take part in their society.

1.3 The family constrains or enables women's freedoms

Despite the advances prompted by the feminist movement during the last quarter of the twentieth century, most families are based on an unequal division of labor. Around the globe, women still do the vast majority of domestic labor — not only tending the house, but also raising and caring for children. Feminist scholars have attacked traditional approaches to the family that obscure this inequality. For example, they have criticized the dominant economic approaches to the family that regard the head of the household as an altruistic agent of the interests of all the family's members (See Becker 1981 for such an approach). They have shown that, in poor countries, when development aid is given to male rather than female heads of household, less of it goes to care for children (Haddad et al. 1997).

Feminist economists and sociologists have also shown how women's role in parenting constrains their ability to pursue careers and compete for demanding jobs (Bergmann 1986, Folbre 1994). Many women therefore remain economically dependent on their male partners, and vulnerable to poverty in the event of divorce. In one widely cited study, ex-husbands' standard of living was found to have risen by 42% the year after their divorce, while ex-wives' standard of living was reduced by 78% (Weitzman 1985). This huge discrepancy in income and wealth results from a number of factors, including the fact that women who have devoted themselves to raising children usually have lower job qualifications than their husbands and less work experience.

Women's economic dependency in turn allows them to be subject to physical, sexual or psychological abuse by their husbands or other male partners (Gordon, 1988; Global Fund for Women Report, 1992). Women have an asymmetric ability to exit from marriage; and this gives husbands/male partners considerably more power and bargaining advantage within the marriage (Sen 1989).

Defenders of the status quo often argue that if women have less opportunity than men, this is largely due to their own choices. Feminists have countered this claim by showing the ways that such choices are shaped and constrained by forces that are themselves objectionable and not freely chosen. Some feminists follow Nancy Chodorow's argument (1978) that the fact that children's primary nurturers are mothers leads to a sexually differentiated developmental path for boys and girls. Girls identify with the same-sex nurturing parent, and feel more connected to others; boys, by identifying with the absent parent, feel themselves to be more “individuated”. Chodorow argues that mothering is thereby reproduced across generations by a largely unconscious mechanism that, in turn, perpetuates the inequality of women at home and at work.

Chodorow's work is controversial, but it is undeniable that girls and boys grow up facing different expectations of how they will behave. Children receive strong cultural messages — from parents, teachers, peers and the media — about sex-appropriate traits and behaviors. Girls are supposed to be nurturing, self-sacrificing, non-aggressive and attractive; “care” is largely seen as a feminine characteristic. These traits traditionally contribute to women's inequality: nurturers are not seen as good leaders. There are few women CEOs, generals, or political leaders. Girls may also become disadvantaged by the anticipation of marriage and child-rearing, insofar as they are less likely than boys to invest in their human “capital”.

A second feminist response stresses the ways that women's choices in the family interact with unjust social structures outside the family, in particular, with the sex segregated division of labor in the economy, where women still earn only about 75% of what men earn, for comparable work. Given women's lower wages, it is rational for families who must provide their own childcare to choose to withdraw women from the workforce. Once women withdraw, they find themselves falling further behind their male counterparts in skill development and earning power. Child care is an immensely time consuming activity and those who do it single-handedly are unlikely to be able to pursue other goods such as education, political office or demanding careers. The structures of work and family thus form a “cycle of vulnerability” that conditions the lives and choices of women (Okin 1989). Even those who do somehow manage to combine work and family, face serious obstacles including the lack of good quality subsidized day care; jobs with little flexibility for those who need to care for a sick child; school schedules that seem to be premised on having a parent at home; and the expectation that they will continue to work a “second shift”, (Hochschild 1989) assuming the responsibility for the bulk of household labor. Statistical analysis shows that motherhood tends to lower a woman's earnings, even if she does not take any time off from paid work (Folbre 1994). Gender inequality persists in access to positions in economy and government where white males are about 40% of population but 95% of senior managers, 90% of newspaper editors, and 80% of congressional legislators (Rhode 1997).

Feminists share the view that contemporary families are not only realms of choice but also realms of constraint. Feminists also agree that the gender hierarchy in our society is unjust, although they differ on its sources. Some feminists emphasize the family as the “linchpin” of gender injustice (Okin 1989); while others see the main causes in the structure of work and opportunity (Bergmann 1986); still others stress sexual domination and violence (MacKinnon 1989). All of these strands seem important contributors to gender inequality, and it is doubtful that any one can be fully reduced to the others. It is therefore important to deepen our understanding of the interplay of these different sources of subordination. Gender also undoubtedly interacts with other axes of social disadvantage, such as race and class. Indeed, feminist work on families has increasingly recognized the diverse experiences of women in families that encompass not only heterosexual two parent families, but also single women, lesbian and gay families, and families in poverty. We need to be careful not to lump together distinct social phenomena. Although I will sometimes refer to “the family” in this essay, it is crucial to keep in mind the diversity of family forms and circumstances.

Whether families are the primary cause, or a contributing cause along with other social structures and culturally generated expectations, feminists point to the ways that families are part of a system that reproduces women's social and economic inequality. Families cannot be viewed apart from that system or in isolation from it. Nor can they be assumed to be just: too many of them are not. The issue, for feminists, is not whether the state can intervene in the family and reproduction but how, and to what ends.

2. How should family structures be evaluated?

How should parenting and household responsibilities be distributed? Who should have a right to household earnings? Who has the right to form a family? To have a child? What defines a parent? How many parents can a child have? How many children can a parent have? Answering these already complex questions is additionally complicated by the existence of new technologies that make possible multiple ways of becoming a parent. Below, I examine two main values that feminists have argued should guide the families we make: individual choice and equality.

2.1 Choice based evaluations

The traditional family has seen many changes in the last fifty years. In the decades following WW II increasing numbers of women entered the labor force. Divorce rates increased dramatically: the divorce rate in the 1980s was almost two and a half times what it had been in 1940. The development of the birth control pill has made it easier for women to avoid unwanted pregnancies and to plan when to have children. There are a growing number of single parent families, gay families, and extended families. By 1989, 25% of children were living in single parent households, many of which were poor, prompting a sense that the family was in crisis (Minow 1997). Economic, technological and social factors have together made the full time-stay at home housewife and mother with a working husband a statistical minority.

Laws governing families have also changed. Modern laws are more likely to view men and women as equals, who can be subjected to the authority of each other only with their own consent. In almost all developed nations, legal restrictions on marriage, divorce and abortion were relaxed in a relatively short time, between the mid 1960s and the mid-1980s (Glendon 1987). In Loving v Virginia, for example, the US Supreme Court struck down state laws preventing people from different races from marrying; Roe v Wade legalized abortion. Of course, many of these changes have been contested and there remain serious constraints on women's reproductive choices. Nor can gay people usually marry. But, it is nevertheless true that the family has increasingly evolved from a hierarchical institution based on a fixed status to a set of relationships between individuals based on contract. Indeed, many people now view marriage not as an unalterable condition, but as a contract whose terms can be altered and negotiated by the parties involved.

How far should the contract idea of marriage be taken? Some feminists have proposed extending the contract model to allow any and all consenting adults to marry and to freely choose the terms of their association. These feminists would abolish state-defined marriage altogether and replace it with individual contracts drawn up by each couple wanting to marry (Fineman 1995, Weitzman 1985). Indeed, contracts would allow not only gay couples to marry but would also allow plural marriages, as in the case of polygamy.

Contract or choice based feminists would allow individuals themselves to determine what kinds of families they want to create. Thus, they would allow people to make their own agreements about procreation without state restriction. These arrangements could include not only rights to abortion and contraception, but also rights to contract away parental bonds and to sell and buy gametes and reproductive labor. Thus, choice feminists would allow gay or infertile couples or single persons to contract for sperm or eggs or gestational services before a child is conceived on terms that they alone decide.

On the contract view, the traditionalist's sense that there is a “crisis” surrounding the family is unwarranted. What is in crisis is the nuclear, heterosexual marital unit. But this unit was never good for women (Coontz 1992). Advocates of contract marriage argue that extending the role of choice in reproduction and in the families we make will empower women. For example, contracting can help spur new forms of family, enabling gay couples and single women and men to have children. Gay families have traditionally been more egalitarian in the division of domestic labor then heterosexual families, and less likely to reproduce mothering along gender lines. Others argue that allowing women to sell their reproductive services would empower women and improve their welfare by unleashing a new source of economic power (Shalev 1989).

In contrast to the ideal of families as having an internal nature beyond justice, some feminists have even proposed using a marriage contract to determine the domestic division of labor. They argue that by moving marriage from an implicit status based, patriarchal arrangement to an explicit contract, women's freedom and equality would be enhanced (Weitzman 1985). This proposal has been criticized on several grounds: as inattentive to the background inequalities would give rise to unequal bargaining power in such a contract (Sen 1989); as potentially undermining to intimacy and commitment within marriage (Anderson 1993) and as opening the door to illiberal intrusions into family life, given the need for states to enforce such contracts (Elshtain 1990).

Other feminist authors have criticized the very idea of choice as applied to reproduction and marriage. They argue that practices such as prostitution, surrogacy or gendered marriages are based on objectionable views of women — as bodies, as breeders, or as domestic helpmates — and that these views in fact underlie seemingly freely choices to enter these practices. For example, Catherine MacKinnon (1989) argues that such choices can as easily be viewed as based on subordination and domination as on free consent. And Carole Pateman (1983) similarly questions the choices alleged to underlie women's decisions to engage in prostitution.

How deep a challenge do these arguments present to the choice based view of marriage? Proponents of the choice view might plausibly claim that if men and women could explicitly define the terms of their relationships, and retain a right of exit when the terms were not fulfilled, then at least extreme forms of gender domination would be undercut. They might also stress the ways that their view accommodates a plurality of understandings of human relationship: allowing for experimentation, diversity and exit options. It is true that contracts would allow men and women to contract for traditional gendered families, but why should we object to such families if they are freely entered into and express the values of the participants? Behind this disagreement is an important division over the extent to which a just society must accommodate different views of family relation. Where does society draw the line on toleration of hierarchical views of men and women's roles? When should a view of family form be ruled out of bounds because it is too inegalitarian?

2.2 Equality based evaluations

Many egalitarian arguments agree with much of the choice based perspective and hold that choice, liberty and privacy are all important elements of just families and reproductive practices. But feminists making these arguments question whether a contractual, choice based approach to these issues adequately captures other values that are also important. The fact that an arrangement has been chosen does not make it just. In addition to choice, egalitarian feminists stress gender equality and the protection of the vulnerable.

Consider the domestic division of labor. Drawing on the above discussion of labor market segregation, some feminists argue that the gendered division of labor in the family, even if freely chosen, operates in the context of a background system of injustice. The fact that it is freely chosen then (if it is) does not seek to justify it. Choices are not all that is relevant to moral evaluation for two reasons. First, because we need to maintain just background social structures, we must be attentive to choices that would undermine these structures. If gendered families encourage the subordination and deference of girls, and produce unequal opportunities for boys and girls, then a just society must seek to redress those effects. Second, the understanding of marriage as a choice does not by itself draw attention to the background social institutions — institutions which feminists argue are unjust. It is not enough to allow people to choose if their choices are unfairly constrained by unequal family and workplace structures, and inadequate social and welfare services which together render so many women vulnerable. Over a century ago, Mill had pointed out that women's decision to marry could scarcely be called “free” given women's low wages, and dim employment and educational prospects. The choice to marry was he said, a Hobson's choice, that or nothing. Although the situation of women has improved, marriage remains an economic necessity for many women today as well. We must attend to the wider context in which choices are made.

Egalitarians supplement and constrain the contract-based perspective where it renders woman subordinate or especially vulnerable. They might also point out, with the critics of choice based views, that some choices are not and cannot be fully informed. Consider, for example, a contract based view of marriage and child-bearing that holds people fully responsible for the results of their choices. Contracts in marriage and childbearing involve potentially long-term contracts, with implications that are not easily known in advance. Can a woman who has never been pregnant accurately predict the effects of ceding her parental rights to a child? Can an eighteen year old woman who agrees to a traditional gendered division of labor in her marriage know what she will feel like as a fifty year old woman suddenly left by her husband?

Feminists differ on whether choices within the family that undermine gender equality should be respected. They also differ on how to deal with those choices when it is agreed that they must be redressed. Some feminists prefer to de-rail such choices indirectly, by creating incentives for people to act so as to maintain just social structures or by creating external counterweights to individual actions. Okin (1989) argues, for example, that spouses should be equally entitled to earnings, that day care should be available to all families, and that work should be made more flexible. She believes that reconfiguring outward structures is the most appropriate way to shape individual choice inside the family. Alternative views give less room for individual choice within the family. Consider proposals to legally mandate shared domestic responsibilities. Other feminists consider such a remedy worse than the malady it is designed to redress (Elshtain 1990).

Some feminist scholars explicitly try to combine and balance a commitment to choice with a commitment to equality. Molly Shanley (2003) advocates an “equal status” view of marriage that combines a commitment to the public importance of marriage as an institution with elements of individual choice that broaden the idea of who can marry to groups that have been denied such status as a result of their subordination and stigmatization. Shanley emphasizes the public's interest in sustaining just marriages, as well as its interest in sustaining certain forms of family relationship in the face of poverty or illness. Equal status requires attention to the background in which individual choices are made, especially to issues of poverty, workplace structure and job market segregation. But it also attends to the value of intimacy and the role of choices as enabling or undermining that intimacy.

Choice based arguments and equality arguments differ on the nature of the marriages they would allow. For example, while a choice based contractual view favors plural marriages, egalitarian arguments do not straightforwardly imply a right to legalized polygamy. For egalitarians, the crucial question would be whether polygamy is possible without the subordination of women.

There is thus serious disagreement among feminists (and non feminists!) as to how to balance freedom and equality, and more specifically values based on freedom of association and freedom of religion with the value of gender equality. This disagreement has implications for the scope of legitimate state intervention in family life. (For further discussion, see Nussbaum 2000.)

2.3 The Interests of Children

Although some families cannot or choose not to have children, it is impossible to think about issues surrounding the family and reproduction without considering the interests of children. Putting children into the equation also shows how we need to think very concretely about the meaning and implications of the values we endorse.

Consider choice based arguments in favor of contractual families. Children do not choose to enter their families; moreover, children are, at least initially, completely dependent on their caretakers. Parents are rightly taken to have an obligation to care for their children that does not rest on children's consent or contract. Furthermore, a choice by parents to participate in a gendered family affects the lives of their children. The free choices of such parents generate unequal opportunities for their children, inequalities that children themselves have not chosen.

Although some thinkers have advocated licensing parents (Mill 1869, LaFollette 1980), today anyone who can biologically produce a child can be a parent. (The issue becomes complicated when more than two people are involved in the production of a child, as we will see below.) Adoption is highly regulated by law, but once an adoption is completed, law treats biological and non-biological parents alike with respect to raising their children. Society gives wide discretion to all families in rearing children and intervenes only when children suffer abuse, or where the family falls apart. Earlier courts used a “best interests” standard to determine custody in such cases. But this standard has been subjected to powerful criticisms: reasonable people will differ about what constitutes the “best” for their child; and the standard is easily susceptible to biases based on class, race and sexual orientation. Ian Shapiro (1999) advocates a “basic interest” standard for legitimizing state intervention. We might think of such basic interests as defining a line beneath which no child should be allowed to sink. The question for feminists here is whether gender equality is a basic interest of children and if so how best to promote it.

Feminists have begun to explore some of the gender issues surrounding adoption and parental rights; including whether an unwed father should have veto rights to the mother's decision to place their child up for adoption; and the roles of gestational as well as genetic contribution in determining parenthood (Shanley 2001).

When we think of children, we must also think of how they are produced. Some feminists see women's subordination as fundamentally caused by their role in reproduction: only test tube babies will make possible women's equality (Firestone 1970). But this seems like an overstatement: it is not the biology of child production that makes women subordinate but its sociology and economics. Surely, adoptive mothers are as vulnerable to workplace structures of gender hierarchy as biological ones. Nonetheless, bearing a child can have dramatic and negative consequences for women when it occurs in a context of little social support and rigid job structures. The U.S. Family and Medical Leave Act was a partial step in the right direction, granting twelve weeks of unpaid leave for a new parent with all benefits and the right to return to the same or a comparable job. But it is difficult to enforce, and work culture makes it hard for those entitled to exercise their right. Men, in particular are unlikely to take time off following the birth of a child.

It is therefore worthwhile to look into new technologies that make possible new ways of becoming (or failing to become) a parent. What are the implications of these technologies for the condition of women? For children?

3. Reproductive Choice

Historically, men have exercised enormous power over women's bodies through controlling their sexuality and reproduction.

3.1 Abortion

Roe v Wade (1973) granted women the right to terminate an unwanted pregnancy, based on an implicit fundamental right to privacy. Although the Supreme Court in its decision did not hold such right was absolute, and argued that it must be weighted against competing state interests in maternal safety and the protection of prenatal life, it protected this right during the first trimester of pregnancy. In the decades following Roe, its ruling has been weakened, most notably by requirements of spousal and parental notification and consent, the enactment of “waiting periods” and restrictions on the use of public funds. In the wake of continued social controversy as well as violence and harassment directed at abortion service providers, the number of doctors who are willing and able to provide such services is declining. By the mid 1990s, 85% of America's counties had no facility offering abortions; 2 states had only 1 provider (Rhode 1997).

Although most feminists endorse some right to abortion, the issue of abortion cannot easily be reduced to the interests of men versus the interests of women. Women are represented on both sides of the abortion issue, as leaders, activists and supporters. Even among feminist arguments in favor or abortion there are a diversity of views as to the grounds that serve to justify it.

Some arguments for permitting a right to abortion depend on denying rights to the fetus. Only persons have rights and fetuses, it is argued, are not yet persons (Tooley 1972). Yet while many arguments against abortion depend on the idea that the fetus has a right to life, not all arguments supporting legal abortion reject that right. Judith Jarvis Thomson (1971) argued that even if the fetus is a person with a right to life, there are limits on what the state can compel women who carry fetuses in their bodies to do. If women have rights over their own bodies, then they have rights not to have their bodies used by others against their will. The state has no right to force someone to donate use of her body to another person, even if that person is in extreme need. (In Thomson's famous example, a person is hooked up to a famous violinist, who will die if she withdraws her body's support.) Thomson's argument stresses bodily integrity and self-ownership, and argues that if we accept these premises we can only allow fetuses to use women's bodies with women's consent. Implicit in Thomson's argument is also a point about gender equality: since we do not in general compel people (i.e., women and men) to donate use of their bodies to others even in cases of extreme need, then why do we think we are justified in only compelling women?

For some feminists Thomson's analogy is not appropriate. They reject the perspective of thinking of fetus and mother as distinct persons and emphasize their intertwined relationship. Others worry that the perspective of abortion as a right having to do with ownership and control of one's body would make it difficult to question abortions preformed on grounds of sex selection, a practice which is becoming more common around the world in countries where having girls is disfavored; or abortions sought on trivial grounds like the timing of a vacation.

To view abortion only in terms of the freedom of individual choice or even as a clash of rights neglects a range of other relevant considerations. These include: the fact that women and only women get pregnant and bear children, that women earn less than men, that they are subjected to sexual violence, have little or no access to publicly provided day care, and that they have less familial or political decision-making power than men. Abortion is connected to other issues that need to be considered, especially the effects of unwanted pregnancies on the lives of women and children (Sherwin 1987).

Feminists who see a range of values at stake in abortion are more likely to advocate compromise than those who hold single valued perspectives. Shrage (1994), for example, proposes that given the diversity of values involved in the abortion controversy — including views of life's sanctity (Dworkin 1993) and the meaning of motherhood (Luker 1984) we seek only conditional access to abortion — during the first trimester — and advocate policies that help minimize the need for abortion, such as easily available contraception.

3.2 Commercial Surrogacy

It is now possible for individuals or couples to transact for reproductive services. New technologies now make possible the creation of children whose genes come from people unrelated to the woman who gives birth to them or to the people who raise them. For example, a couple can buy eggs from one woman and then implant those eggs in another woman. Or they can implant a man's sperm in a woman who will bear the child.

Of course, market transactions regarding genetic materials are not new: men have sold sperm in the United States for decades. But contemporary law is unsettled on the issue of commercial surrogacy.

The so-called Baby M case is perhaps the best-known case involving “surrogate motherhood”, although the use of the term in this case is, arguably, misleading. Mary Beth Whitehead agreed to be inseminated with the sperm of William Stern and to give up any resulting child to him and his wife for $10,000. After giving birth to a child and turning that child over to the Sterns, Whitehead became distraught. A conflict ensued over parental rights, and a New Jersey court initially gave full custody to the Sterns and discounted the fact that Whitehead was the child's genetic and gestational mother. On appeal, the decision was overturned and the surrogacy contract was invalidated. The court granted custody to the Sterns but ordered that Whitehead be granted visitation rights.

Feminists are divided on the issue of commercial surrogacy. Those who support surrogate motherhood often stress the increase in freedom it brings. Surrogate contracts allow women to have additional choices over their reproduction. Carmel Shalev (1989) goes further, arguing that prohibiting such contracts fails to give due respect to the choices women do make. If a woman freely enters into a contract to produce a child, it is paternalistic and demeaning to prevent her choice.

Defenders of commercial surrogacy also carefully distinguish it from baby selling: children are not sold as commodities, but rather women's reproductive services are for sale. Since we allow men to sell their sperm, why should women be prevented from participating in an analogous transaction? Finally, defenders point out that commercial surrogacy offers new ways for gays and lesbians and single people to become parents.

Critics of commercial surrogacy likewise offer a diversity of objections. Perhaps the most common objection is based on the claim that gestational labor is different from other types of labor. Margaret Jane Radin (1988) and Carole Pateman (1983) stress the ways that the labor of bearing a child is more intimately bound up with a woman's identity than other types of labor. Contract pregnancy involves an alienation of aspects of the self so extreme as to make it an illegitimate practice. Selling sperm is not analogous: the work of pregnancy is long-term, complex and involves an emotional and physical bonding between mother and fetus. (See also Rich 1976 for a brilliant phenomenology of pregnancy.)

Elizabeth Anderson (1990) echoes this objection, but adds that surrogacy contracts also alienate a woman from her love for the child and frequently involve exploitation, as surrogate sellers have less wealth and are more emotionally vulnerable than buyers. Other objections stress the weakening of the link between parent and child, and the special vulnerability of children.

Satz (1992) argues that there are limits to the objections based on an intimate connection between reproductive labor and our selves. Writers are intimately bound up with their writing, but they also want to be paid for their novels. Further, if the link between mother and fetus/reproductive labor is so strong, how can abortion be justified? Instead, Satz's argument stresses the background context of commercial surrogacy: the gender inequality in modern society. Commercial surrogacy allows women's labor to be used and controlled by others, and reinforces stereotypes about women. For example, pregnancy contracts give buyers substantial control rights over women's bodies: rights to determine what the women eat, drink and do. They also may deepen stereotypes: that women are baby-machines. Finally, the race and class dimensions of such markets also need to be considered. In another well known case involving commercial surrogacy, a judge referred to the African American women who gave birth to a child with genes from a white father and a Philippina mother as the baby's “wet-nurse” and refused to grant her any visitation rights to see the child.

Interestingly, practices such as in vitro fertilization, commercial surrogacy and egg and gamete markets are largely unregulated. There are also huge for profit agencies involved in these ways of making a baby. By contrast, adoption is highly regulated: prospective parents have to submit to intrusive interviews and home visits. It is worth reflecting on this differential treatment, especially since many reproductive technologies also involve vulnerable third parties.

4. Concluding thoughts

Feminist writing on the family and reproduction is rich and multifaceted. By forcing mainstream political philosophy to take into account the importance of the family for social justice, feminists have changed the field. At the same time, our efforts remain very much a work in progress, much as are our current social practices of making families and babies. In conclusion, I will mention two areas that need more attention:

(1) The claim that the family is not private is not the same as the claim that there is no value to having a concept of privacy, nor does it entail that there is no way to draw a useful distinction between the private and public realms. How much public structuring of private choices is permissible to foster gender justice? How do we balance claims of gender injustice with other moral considerations like freedom of religion and freedom of association?

(2) With notable exceptions, too few feminist philosophers have offered specific policy proposals for changes in domestic arrangements, or for policies designed to counteract those arrangements. We need more attention to creative family related policies that might lessen the hold of centuries of gender hierarchy. We also need good cross-country comparisons, which draw on some of the alternative policies that have been tried in other countries, including policies designed to re-shape labor markets, reform divorce law and provide safety nets for poor families and their children.

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Related Entries

childhood, the philosophy of | feminist (interventions): ethics | feminist (topics): perspectives on class and work | feminist (topics): perspectives on sex and gender