Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy
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Heraclitus

First published Thu Feb 8, 2007; substantive revision Tue Mar 29, 2011

A Greek philosopher of Ephesus (near modern Kuşadası, Turkey) who was active around 500 BCE, Heraclitus propounded a distinctive theory which he expressed in oracular language. He is best known for his doctrines that things are constantly changing (universal flux), that opposites coincide (unity of opposites), and that fire is the basic material of the world. The exact interpretation of these doctrines is controversial, as is the inference often drawn from this theory that in the world as Heraclitus conceives it contradictory propositions must be true.

1. Life and Work

Little is known of Heraclitus' life; most of what has been handed down consists of stories apparently invented to illustrate his character as inferred from his writings (Diogenes Laertius 9.1–17). His native Ephesus was a prominent city of Ionia, the Greek-inhabited coast of Asia Minor, but was subject to Persian rule in his lifetime. According to one account, he inherited the honorific title and office of “king” of the Ionians, which he resigned to his brother. He is generally considered to have favored aristocratic government as against democracy, based on his own political observations. 

His city lies close to Miletus, where the first thinkers recognized in later tradition as philosophers lived; but there is no record of his having made the acquaintance of any of the Milesian thinkers (Thales, Anaximander, Anaximenes) or having been taught by them, or of his ever having traveled.

He is said to have written a single book (papyrus roll), and deposited it in the great temple of Artemis at Ephesus. The story is plausible enough: temples often served as depositories for money and other valuables, and no libraries are known from the time of Heraclitus. The structure of Heraclitus' book is controversial. It could have consisted of a relatively coherent and consecutive argument. On the other hand, the numerous fragments (over one hundred) that have come down to us do not easily connect with each other, even though they probably constitute a sizable fraction of the whole. Thus it is possible and even likely that the book was composed more of sayings and epigrams than of continuous exposition. In its form, then, it might have looked more like a collection of proverbs such as were ascribed to the seven sages than like a cosmological treatise of the Milesians. Theophrastus, who knew his book, said that it seemed only half-finished, a kind of hodgepodge he attributed to the author's melancholy.  Diogenes Laertius reports that the work was divided (he does not say by whom) into three sections, one on cosmology, one on politics (and ethics), and one on theology (9.5–6). All these topics are treated in the extant fragments of Heraclitus, though it is often difficult to see what boundaries the work might have drawn between them, since Heraclitus seems to see deep interconnections between science, human affairs, and theology.

Unlike most other early philosophers, Heraclitus is usually seen as independent of the several schools and movements later students (somewhat anachronistically) assigned to the ancients, and he himself implies that he is self-taught (B101). He has been variously judged by ancient and modern commentators to be a material monist or a process philosopher; a scientific cosmologist, a metaphysician, or a mainly religious thinker; an empiricist, a rationalist, or a mystic; a conventional thinker or a revolutionary; a developer of logic or one who denied the law of non-contradiction; the first genuine philosopher or an anti-intellectual obscurantist. No doubt the sage of Ephesus will continue to remain controversial and difficult to interpret, but scholars have made significant progress in understanding and appreciating his work.

2. Method

Heraclitus made every effort to break out of the mold of contemporary thought. Although he was influenced in a number of ways by the thought and language of his predecessors, including the epic poets Homer and Hesiod, the poet and philosopher Xenophanes, the historian and antiquarian Hecataeus, the religious guru Pythagoras, the sage Bias of Priene, the poet Archilochus, and the Milesian philosophers, he criticized most of them either explicitly or implicitly, and struck out on his own path. He rejected polumathiê or information-gathering on the grounds that it “does not teach understanding” (B40). He treated the epic poets as fools and called Pythagoras a fraud.

In his fragments Heraclitus does not explicitly criticize the Milesians, and it is likely that he saw them as the most progressive of previous thinkers. He does tacitly criticize Anaximander for not appreciating the role of injustice in the world (B80), while he might have expressed some admiration for Thales (B38). His views can be seen to embody structural criticisms of Milesian principles, but even in correcting the Milesians he built on their foundations. 

Heraclitus' most fundamental departure from previous philosophy lies in his emphasis on human affairs. While he continues many of the physical and cosmological theories of his predecessors, he shifts his focus from the cosmic to the human realm. We might well think of him as the first humanist, were it not for the fact that he does not seem to like humanity very well. From the outset he makes it clear that most people are too stupid to understand his theory.  He may be most concerned with the human relevance of philosophic theories, but he is an elitist like Plato, who thinks that only select readers are capable of benefitting from his teachings. And perhaps for this reason he, like Plato, does not teach his philosophical principles directly, but couches them in a literary form that distances the author from the reader. In any case he seems to regard himself not as the author of a philosophy so much as the spokesman for an independent truth:

Having harkened not to me but to the Word (Logos) it is wise to agree that all things are one. (B50)

Heraclitus stresses that the message is not his own invention, but a timeless truth available to any who attend to the way the world itself is. “Although this Word is common,” he warns, “the many live as if they had a private understanding” (B2). The Word (account, message) exists apart from Heraclitus' teaching, but he tries to convey that message to his audience.

The blindness of humans is one of Heraclitus' main themes.  He announces it at the beginning of his book:

Of this Word's being forever do men prove to be uncomprehending, both before they hear and once they have heard it. For although all things happen according to this Word, they are like the unexperienced experiencing words and deeds such as I explain when I distinguish each thing according to its nature and show how it is. Other men are unaware of what they do when they are awake just as they are forgetful of what they do when they are asleep. (B1)

He begins by warning his readers that most of them will not understand his message. He promises to “distinguish each thing according to its nature and show how it is,” a claim similar to the Milesians’. Yet like sleepers his readers will not understand the world around them. As this implies, in his book Heraclitus does have some things to say about the natural world, but much more to say about the human condition.

No less important than Heraclitus' message is the form in which he imparts it to his audience. Aristotle noticed that even in the first sentence of B1, quoted above, the force of the word ‘forever’ was unclear: did it go with the preceding or the subsequent words, with ‘being’ or ‘prove’ (Rhetoric 1407b11–18)?  He regarded the ambiguity as a weakness in Heraclitus' communication. But if we attend to Heraclitus' language we see that syntactical ambiguity is more than an accident: it is a common technique he uses to enrich his words and to infuse them with a unique verbal complexity like that of poetry. Charles Kahn (1979: 89) identifies two general traits of Heraclitus' style, linguistic density and resonance. The former is his ability to pack multiple meanings into a single word or phrase, the latter his ability to use one expression to evoke another. To take a simple example:

moroi mezones mezonas moiras lanchanousi.

Deaths that are greater greater portions gain. (B25)

Heraclitus uses alliteration (four m-words in a row) and chiasmus (an ABBA pattern) to link death and reward. The latter appears as a mirror image of the former, and in sound and sense they fuse together. Another fragment consists of three words in Greek:

êthos anthrôpôi daimôn.

The character of man is his guardian spirit. (B119)

The second word, in the dative case “to” or “for” man, stands between the names of two very unlike objects, ‘character’ and ‘deity.’  Grammatically, it can attach to either indifferently, and seems intended to be heard with both, so that it counts twice. Because of its double role, the word forms a kind of syntactic glue between the otherwise diverse subjects, joining them together in a unity.  Traditionally having a good or a bad guardian spirit constitutes one's “luck”–one is eudaimôn or dusdaimôn, fortunate or wretched, at the mercy of one's divine overseer. But Heraclitus turns one's luck into a function of one's character, one's ethical stance, by making “man” the link.

Ultimately, Heraclitus loads his words with layers of meaning and complexities that are to be discovered in insights and solved like riddles. As he implies in the second sentence of his introduction, B1, his logoi are designed to be experienced, not just understood, and only those who experience them in their richness will grasp his message.

3. Philosophical Principles

Although his words are meant to provide concrete vicarious encounters with the world, Heraclitus adheres to some abstract principles which govern the world. Already in antiquity he was famous for advocating the coincidence of opposites, the flux doctrine, and his view that fire is the source and nature of all things. In commenting on Heraclitus, Plato provided an early reading, followed tentatively by Aristotle, and popular down to the present (sharpened and forcefully advocated by Barnes 1982, ch. 4). According to Barnes’ version, Heraclitus is a material monist who believes that all things are modifications of fire. Everything is in flux (in the sense that “everything is always flowing in some respects,” 69), which entails the coincidence of opposites (interpreted as the view that “every pair of contraries is somewhere coinstantiated; and every object coinstantiates at least one pair of contraries,” 70). The coincidence of opposites, thus interpreted, entails contradictions, which Heraclitus cannot avoid. On this view Heraclitus is influenced by the prior theory of material monism and by empirical observations that tend to support flux and the coincidence of opposites. In a time before the development of logic, Barnes concludes, Heraclitus violates the principles of logic and makes knowledge impossible.

Obviously this reading is not charitable to Heraclitus. There are, moreover, reasons to question it. First, some of Heraclitus' views are incompatible with material monism (to be discussed later), so that the background of his theories must be rethought. Second, there is evidence that Heraclitus' flux theory is weaker than that attributed to him by this reading.  Third, there is evidence that his view of the coincidence of opposites is weaker than that attributed to him here. 

3.1 Flux

Barnes bases his Platonic reading on Plato's own statement:

Heraclitus, I believe, says that all things pass and nothing stays, and comparing existing things to the flow of a river, he says you could not step twice into the same river. (Plato Cratylus 402a = A6)

The established scholarly method is to try to verify Plato's interpretation by looking at Heraclitus' own words, if possible. There are three alleged “river fragments”:

B12. potamoisi toisin autoisin embainousin hetera kai hetera hudata epirrei.

On those stepping into rivers staying the same other and other waters flow. (Cleanthes from Arius Didymus from Eusebius)

B49a. potamois tois autois … 

Into the same rivers we step and do not step, we are and are not. (Heraclitus Homericus)

B91[a]. potamôi … tôi autôi …

It is not possible to step twice into the same river according to Heraclitus, or to come into contact twice with a mortal being in the same state. (Plutarch)

Of these only the first has the linguistic density characteristic of Heraclitus' words. The second starts out with the same three words as B12, but in Attic, not in Heraclitus' Ionic dialect, and the second clause has no grammatical connection to the first. The third is patently a paraphrase by an author famous for quoting from memory rather than from books. Even it starts out in Greek with the word ‘river,’ but in the singular.  There is no evidence that repetitions of phrases with variations are part of Heraclitus' style (as they are of Empedocles’). To start with the word ‘river(s)’ goes against normal Greek prose style, and on the plausible assumption that all sources are trying to imitate Heraclitus, who does not repeat himself, we would be led to choose B12 as the one and only river fragment, the only actual quotation from Heraclitus' book.  This is the conclusion of  Kirk (1954) and  Marcovich (1967), based on an interpretation that goes back to  Reinhardt (1916). That B12 is genuine is suggested by the features it shares with Heraclitean fragments: syntactic ambiguity (toisin autoisin ‘the same’ [in the dative] can be construed either with ‘rivers’ [“the same rivers”] or with ‘those stepping in’ [“the same people”], with what comes before or after), chiasmus, sound-painting (the first phrase creates the sound of rushing water with its diphthongs and sibilants), rhyme and alliteration.[1]

If B12 is accepted as genuine, it tends to disqualify the other two alleged fragments. The major theoretical connection in the fragment is that between ‘same rivers’ and ‘other waters.’  B12 is, among other things, a statement of the coincidence of opposites. But it specifies the rivers as the same. The statement is, on the surface, paradoxical, but there is no reason to take it as false or contradictory. It makes perfectly good sense: we call a body of water a river precisely because it consists of changing waters; if the waters should cease to flow it would not be a river, but a lake or a dry streambed. There is a sense, then, in which a river is a remarkable kind of existent, one that remains what it is by changing what it contains (cf. Hume Treatise 1.4.6, p. 258 Selby-Bigge). Heraclitus derives a striking insight from an everyday encounter. Further, he supplies, via the ambiguity in the first clause, another reading: on the same people stepping into rivers, other and other waters flow. With this reading it is people who remain the same in contrast to changing waters, as if the encounter with a flowing environment helped to constitute the perceiving subject as the same. (See Kahn 1979.)  B49a, by contrast, contradicts the claim that one can step into the same rivers (and also asserts that claim), and B91[a], like Plato in the Cratylus, denies that one can step in twice. Yet if the rivers remain the same, one surely can step in twice–not into the same waters, to be sure, but into the same rivers. Thus the other alleged fragments are incompatible with the one certifiably genuine fragment.

In fact, Marcovich (1967) has succeeded in showing how a misreading of B12 could lead to an interpretation such as that embodied in A6 and B91[a]. It is possible to see Cratylus, a late follower of Heraclitus, supplying the wayward reading, and then adding his famous rejoinder that one cannot step into the same river even once (although the reading may go back earlier to Hippias:  Mansfeld 1990: 43–55). Since Plato is alleged to have heard Cratylus’ lectures, he may well have derived his reading from Cratylus’ criticism. 

If this interpretation is right, the message of the one river fragment, B12, is not that all things are changing so that we cannot encounter them twice, but something much more subtle and profound. It is that some things stay the same only by changing. One kind of long-lasting material reality exists by virtue of constant turnover in its constituent matter. Here constancy and change are not opposed but inextricably connected. A human body could be understood in precisely the same way, as living and continuing by virtue of constant metabolism–as Aristotle for instance later understood it.  On this reading, Heraclitus believes in flux, but not as destructive of constancy; rather it is, paradoxically, a necessary condition of constancy, at least in some cases (and arguably in all). In general, at least in some exemplary cases, high-level structures supervene on low-level material flux. The Platonic reading still has advocates (e.g. Tarán 1999), but it is no longer the only reading of Heraclitus advocated by scholars.

3.2 The Unity of Opposites

Heraclitus' flux doctrine is a special case of the unity of opposites, pointing to ways things are both the same and not the same over time. He depicts two key opposites that are interconnected, but not identical. Heraclitus sometimes explains how things have opposite qualities:

Sea is the purest and most polluted water: for fish drinkable and healthy, for men undrinkable and harmful. (B61)

Barnes thinks Heraclitus gets his doctrine of the universal coinstantiation of contraries through fallaciously dropping qualifiers (such as: ‘for fish,’ ‘for men’). But B61 shows he is perfectly aware of them, and we might rather say that he understands them tacitly even when he does not utter them. When he says,

Collections: wholes and not wholes; brought together, pulled apart; sung in unison, sung in conflict; from all things one and from one all things (B10)

he does not contradict himself. There are perfectly good contexts in which everything he says is true. One can divide a collection into its parts or join the parts into a unified whole. 

Most tellingly, Heraclitus explains just how contraries are connected:

As the same thing in us are living and dead, waking and sleeping, young and old. For these things having changed around are those, and those in turn having changed around are these.(B88)

Contrary qualities are found in us “as the same thing.”  But they are the same by virtue of one thing changing around to another. We are asleep and we wake up; we are awake and we go to sleep. Thus sleep and waking are both found in us, but not at the same time or in the same respect. Indeed, if sleeping and waking were identical, there would be no change as required by the second sentence. Contraries are the same by virtue of constituting a system of connections: alive-dead, waking-sleeping, young-old. Subjects do not possess incompatible properties at the same time, but at different times.

In general, what we see in Heraclitus is not a conflation of opposites into an identity, but a series of subtle analyses revealing the interconnectedness of contrary states in life and in the world.  There is no need to impute to him a logical fallacy. Opposites are a reality, and their interconnections are real, but the correlative opposites are not identical to each other.

3.3 Ontology

The standard view of Heraclitus' ontology since Aristotle is that he is a material monist who holds that fire is the ultimate reality; all things are just manifestations of fire. According to Aristotle the Milesians in general were material monists who advocated other kinds of ultimate matter: Thales water, Anaximander the boundless, Anaximenes air (Metaphysics 983b6–984a8). So Heraclitus' theory was just another version of a common background theory. There are problems already with Aristotle's understanding of the Milesians: Aristotle lacks any textual evidence for Thales’ view and must reconstruct it out of almost nothing; he sometimes treats Anaximander as a pluralist like Anaxagoras who thinks the boundless is a mixture of qualities; at most Anaximenes might exemplify material monism–but Plato reads him as a pluralist (Timaeus 39 with Graham 2003b; Graham 2003a). In the case of Heraclitus, his own statements make material monism problematic as an interpretation. According to material monism, some kind of matter is the ultimate reality, and any variation in the world consists merely of qualitative or possibly quantitative change in it; for there is only one reality, for instance fire, which can never come into existence or perish, but can only change in its appearances. Heraclitus, however, advocates a radical kind of change:

For souls it is death to become water, for water death to become earth, but from earth water is born, and from water soul. (B36)

(Here soul seems to occupy the place of fire.)  The language of birth and death in the world of living things is precisely the language used in Greek metaphysics for coming to be and perishing. It implies a radical transformation that rules out continuing identity (cf. B76, B62). Indeed, interpreters of Heraclitus cannot have it both ways: Heraclitus cannot be both a believer in radical flux (the change of everything into everything else: fire into water, water into earth, and so on) and an advocate of monism. Either he must believe in a merely illusory or at most a limited kind of change, or he must be a pluralist. 

One further difficulty remains for the monist reading. In his alleged version of monism, fire is the ultimate reality. Yet fire (as the ancients recognized) is the least substantial and the most evanescent of elemental stuffs. It makes a better symbol of change than of permanence. Other alleged cases of material monism offer a basic kind of matter that could arguably be stable and permanent over long periods of time; but fire manifests “need and satiety” (B65), a kind of ongoing consumption that can live only by devouring fuel. Is not Heraclitus' choice of a basic reality itself paradoxical?  At best his appeal to fire seems to draw on material monism in a way that points beyond the theory to an account  in which the process of change is more real than the material substances that undergo change.

4. Cosmology

Although Heraclitus is more than a cosmologist, he does offer a cosmology. His most fundamental statement on cosmology is found in B30:

This world-order [kosmos], the same of all, no god nor man did create, but it ever was and is and will be: everliving fire, kindling in measures and being quenched in measures.

In this passage, he uses, for the first time in any extant Greek text, the word kosmos “order” to mean something like “world.”  He identifies the world with fire, but goes on to specify portions of fire that are kindling and being quenched. Although ancient sources, including Aristotle (On the Heavens 279b12–17) as well as the Stoics, attributed to Heraclitus a world that was periodically destroyed by fire and then reborn, the present statement seems to contradict that view, as Hegel already noticed. If the world always was and is and will be, then it does not perish and come back into existence, though portions of it (measures of fire) are constantly being transformed. 

Heraclitus describes the transformations of elementary bodies:

The turnings of fire: first sea, and of sea half is earth, half fireburst. (B31[a])

<Earth> is liquefied as sea and measured into the same proportion as it had before it became earth. (B31[b])

Fire turns into water (“sea”), and then half of that quantity turns into earth and half into “fireburst” (prêstêr, a fiery, windy kind of storm phenomenon). The portion that becomes earth turns back into water, in the same quantity it had previously. Here Heraclitus envisages a lawlike transformation of stuff from fire to water to earth; the transformation is reversible, and in it the same relative quantities of stuff are preserved. There is, then, a kind of conservation of matter, or at least overall quantity of matter.  What would make the world to be continuous would be the fact that when one portion of fire turns into water, an equivalent portion of water turns into fire. The overall equilibrium is preserved, even if the water that is now in the sea is not the same water as was in it before. This picture bears a similarity to the image of the river, which remains the same despite its changing material contents. 

In this view of the world, the mutual transformations of matter are not an accidental feature, but the very essence of nature. Without change, there would be no world. Heraclitus seems to acknowledge this in his praise of war and strife:

We must recognize that war is common, strife is justice, and all things happen according to strife and necessity. (B80)

War is father of all and king of all; and some he manifested as gods, some as men; some he made slaves, some free. (B53)

Conflicting powers of opposites, including those of elemental bodies, make possible the world and all its variety; without that conflict we would have only lifeless uniformity. In the former passage Heraclitus is perhaps criticizing Anaximander for his view that cosmic justice consists of a punishment of powers that overstep their boundaries (Anaximander B1). Justice is not the correction of an excess, but the whole pattern of the domination of one opposite followed by that of the other. 

There is, however, a guiding force in the world:

Thunderbolt steers all things. (B64)

The fiery shaft of lightning is a symbol of the direction of the world. Anaximander may have already used the image of the shipmaster of the universe (Kahn 1960: 238). Heraclitus identifies it with the thunderbolt, itself an attribute of Zeus the storm god.  The changes wrought by and symbolized by fire govern the world.  The ruling power of the universe can be identified with Zeus, but not in a straightforward way: “One being, the only wise one, would and would not be called by the name of Zeus” (B32). And here the word used for ‘Zeus’ can be rendered “Life.”  Like the Milesians, Heraclitus identifies the ruling power of the world with deity, but (like them also) his conception is not a conventional one. 

Heraclitus provided some sort of discussion of meteorological and astronomical phenomena. He studied the disappearance and reappearance of the moon at the end and beginning of a month (Oxyrhynchus Papyri LIII 3710 ii. 43–47 and iii. 7–11–the clearest evidence that Heraclitus had a scientific interest in astronomy). He explained the sun and moon as bowls full of fire. As the moon's bowl rotated it caused the phases. Eclipses were the result of a rotation of the convex side of the bowls to face the earth. We have no reports about the earth itself, but we may suppose that, like his predecessors, Heraclitus viewed it as flat. Evaporations from the earth and sea apparently provided fuel for the heavenly bodies, which burned like oil lamps. 

Divine power is manifest in all phenomena: “God is day night, winter summer, war peace, satiety hunger, and he alters just as <fire> when it is mixed with spices is named according to the aroma of each of them” (B67). Again Heraclitus seems to stress the unity of divine power, even if humans assign different names and attributes to it. All things that happen are good, but humans do not perceive them to be so: “To God all things are fair, good and just, but men suppose some things are unjust, some just” (B102). Heraclitus does not attempt to provide a detailed theodicy, but seeks to view all things sub specie aeternitatis, in which conflict (including presumably human conflict) keeps the world going (B80, cited above). 

5. Knowledge

Plato held that for Heraclitus knowledge is made impossible by the flux of sensible objects. Yet Heraclitus does not repudiate knowledge or the wisdom that comes from a proper understanding of the world. To be sure, he believes most people are not capable of wisdom; understanding is a rare and precious commodity, which even most reputed sages do not attain to (B28[a]). Yet wisdom is possible, and it is embodied in Heraclitus' message, for those who can discern it.

Heraclitus seems to accept the evidence of the senses as in some way valuable: “The things of which there is sight, hearing, experience, I prefer” (B55). Sight is the best of the senses: “The eyes are more accurate witnesses than the ears” (B101a). Yet in contrast to those who view knowledge as an accumulation of information or wisdom as a collection of sayings, he requires much more than sensation and memory:

Learning many things does not teach understanding. Else it would have taught Hesiod and Pythagoras, as well as Xenophanes and Hecataeus. (B40)

In this statement Heraclitus reviews the leading authorities of his day, living (the last three) and dead, dealing with religious and secular knowledge, and finds them all wanting. They spend too much effort in collecting information and not enough in grasping its meaning. “What intelligence or understanding do they [the people] have?” asks Heraclitus. “They follow popular bards and treat the crowd as their instructor, not realizing that the many are base, while the few are noble” (B104). He criticizes Hesiod on specifics: “The teacher of the multitude is Hesiod; they believe he has the greatest knowledge–who did not comprehend day and night: for they are one” (B57). In his myths, Hesiod treats Day and Night as separate persons, taking turns traveling abroad, while one remains at home. But this fails to capture the interconnectedness of day and night, and falsifies reality. Heraclitus criticizes Homer, Pythagoras and Archilochus for their inadequacies. 

In general, he holds that people do not learn what they should: “Many do not understand such things as they encounter, nor do they learn by their experience, but they think they do” (B17). Indeed, they do not process the information they receive: “Having heard without comprehension they are like the deaf; this saying bears witness to them: present they are absent” (B34). Heraclitus explains: “Poor witnesses for men are the eyes and ears of those who have barbarian souls” (B107). A barbarian was a non-Greek; just as a foreigner hears Greek words without understanding their meaning, most people perceive without understanding the world around them. Sense perception is necessary for knowledge, but not sufficient; without the ability to decipher information from the senses, one cannot understand the world.

What chance is there then to learn the secrets of the world?  Heraclitus is not wholly pessimistic about human cognitive abilities: “All men have a share in self-knowledge and sound thinking” (B116). What is needed is not simply more sense experience or more information, but an improved way of comprehending the message (logos) that the world offers. In this context his curious method of expression begins to make sense. He presents his statements in the form of puzzles, riddles, aperçus.  Many of them support two or more readings, and contain hidden insights. To comprehend them the reader must grasp their complexity and then discover their unity. To read Heraclitus appropriately is to have a rich cognitive experience, as the philosopher hints in his introduction (B1).

Heraclitus often presents a simple concrete situation or image which has implications for our understanding of the world: a river, a bow, a road. He does not generally pronounce generalizations and deduce consequences. Rather, his method can be seen as inductive: he offers an example which suggests general principles. Unlike most philosophers, he challenges the right brain rather than the left.  He does not teach in the conventional sense; he offers his readers materials for understanding and lets them educate themselves. He cites with approval a model of religious instruction:

The Lord whose oracle is at Delphi neither reveals nor conceals, but gives a sign. (B93)

The riddling statements of the Delphic oracle do not provide straightforward answers, but force people to interpret them. His truths come to the attentive reader as discoveries resulting from the solution of a puzzle.

6. Value

The aim of Heraclitus' unusual approach is to produce readers who have a proper grasp of the world and their place in it.  “Sound thinking is the greatest virtue and wisdom: to speak the truth and to act on the basis of an understanding of the nature of things” (B112). Such an understanding can result only from an ability to interpret the language of nature. The proper understanding allows one to act in a harmonious way.

Heraclitus urges moderation and self-control in a somewhat conventional way (B85, B43). He also recommends the conventional Greek goal of seeking fame: “The best choose one thing above all, the everlasting fame of mortals; the many gorge themselves like cattle” (B29). To die in battle is a superior kind of death (B24). Those who drink to excess make their souls wet, and accordingly harm them (B117), for a healthy soul is dry (B118).  Those who experience better deaths attain better rewards (B25).  Those who lie will be punished (B28[b]). “For men who die there await things they do not expect or anticipate” (B27).  Some of these remarks tend to suggest an afterlife with rewards and punishment, although his belief in a continued existence is controversial (see Nussbaum 1972). In any case, Heraclitus views the soul as the moral and cognitive center of human experience.

In political theory he maintains that one good man is worth ten thousand ordinary people (B49). He criticizes his fellow citizens for banishing a distinguished leader:

The adult citizens of Ephesus should hang themselves, every one, and leave the city to children, since they have banished Hermodorus, a man pre-eminent among them, saying, Let no one stand out among us; or let him stand out elsewhere among others. (B121)

Evidently he trusts the few and distrusts the many. He sees good laws as being reflections of universal principles:

Speaking with sense we must fortify ourselves in the common sense of all, as a city is fortified by its law, and even more forcefully.  For all human laws are nourished by the one divine law. For it prevails as far as it will and suffices for all and is superabundant. (B114)

The divine law, on Heraclitus' view, is probably continuous with the laws governing the cosmos, which maintain justice through opposition (B80).

7. Influence

Although Heraclitus is not known to have had students, his writings seem to have been influential from an early time. He may have provoked Parmenides to develop a contrasting philosophy (Patin 1899; Graham 2002), although their views have much more in common than is generally recognized (Nehamas 2002). Empedocles seems to have invoked Heraclitean themes, and some Hippocratic treatises imitated Heraclitean language and presented applications of Heraclitean themes. Democritus echoed many of Heraclitus' ethical pronouncements in his own ethics. From an early time Heraclitus was seen as the representative of universal flux in contrast to Parmenides, the representative of universal stasis. Cratylus brought Heraclitus' philosophy to Athens, where Plato heard it.  Plato seems to have used Heraclitus' theory (as interpreted by Cratylus) as a model for the sensible world, as he used Parmenides’ theory for the intelligible world. As mentioned, both Plato and Aristotle viewed Heraclitus as violating the law of non-contradiction, and propounding an incoherent theory of knowledge based on a radical flux. Yet Aristotle also treated him as a coherent material monist who posited fire as an ultimate principle. The Stoics used Heraclitus' physics as the inspiration for their own, understanding him to advocate a periodic destruction of the world by fire, followed by a regeneration of the world; Cleanthes in particular commented on Heraclitus.  Aenesidemus interpreted Heraclitus as a kind of proto-skeptic (see Polito 2004). 

Ever since Plato, Heraclitus has been seen as a philosopher of flux. The challenge in interpreting the philosopher of Ephesus has always been to find a coherent theory in his paradoxical utterances. Since Hegel, he has been seen as a paradigmatic process philosopher–perhaps with some justification. 

8. Addendum

The recently published Derveni Papyrus, discovered in a tomb in northern Greece, contains a commentary on an Orphic poem. The commentator discusses some passages of Heraclitus in connection with the poem, namely B3 + B94 (which may have been thus joined in Heraclitus' book) (column 4). See Betegh 2004. The Oxyrhynchus Papyri (vol. 53, no. 3710) also show that Heraclitus was interested in determining the days of the lunar month and thus in scientific questions. See Burkert 1993.

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Parmenides | Presocratic Philosophy