Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy
This is a file in the archives of the Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy.

Karl Jaspers

First published Mon Jun 5, 2006; substantive revision Wed Jan 12, 2011

Karl Jaspers (1883–1969) began his academic career working as a psychiatrist and, after a period of transition, he converted to philosophy in the early 1920s. Throughout the middle decades of the twentieth century he exercised considerable influence on a number of areas of philosophical inquiry: especially on epistemology, the philosophy of religion, and political theory. His philosophy has its foundation in a subjective-experiential transformation of Kantian philosophy, which reconstructs Kantian transcendentalism as a doctrine of particular experience and spontaneous freedom, and emphasizes the constitutive importance of lived existence for authentic knowledge. Jaspers obtained his widest influence, not through his philosophy, but through his writings on governmental conditions in Germany, and after the collapse of National Socialist regime he emerged as a powerful spokesperson for moral-democratic education and reorientation in the Federal Republic of Germany.

Despite his importance in the evolution of both philosophy and political theory in twentieth-century Germany, today Jaspers is a neglected thinker. He did not found a particular philosophical school, he did not attract a cohort of apostles, and, outside Germany at least, his works are not often the subject of high philosophical discussion. This is partly the result of the fact that the philosophers who now enjoy undisputed dominance in modern German philosophical history, especially Martin Heidegger, Georg Lukács and Theodor W. Adorno, wrote disparagingly about Jaspers, and they were often unwilling to take his work entirely seriously. To a perhaps still greater extent, however, his relative marginality is due to the fact that he is associated with the more prosaic periods of German political life, and his name is tarred with an aura of staid bourgeois common sense. Nonetheless, Jaspers' work set the parameters for a number of different philosophical debates, the consequences of which remain deeply influential in contemporary philosophy, and in recent years there have been signs that a more favourable reconstructive approach to his work is beginning to prevail.

1. Career

Jaspers was born in the North German town of Oldenburg in 1883. His family milieu was strongly influenced by the political culture of North German liberalism, and he often referred to the climate of early liberal democratic thought as a formative aspect of his education. Moreover, although he claimed not have been influenced by any specifically ecclesiastical faith, his thought was also formed by the spirit of North German Protestantism, and his philosophical outlook can in many respects be placed in the religiously inflected tradition of Kant and Kierkegaard. His education was extremely diverse and broad-ranging. He initially enrolled as a student of law, but then decided to study to medicine, and he obtained a doctorate in medicine in 1908. He obtained his second doctorate (Habilitation) in psychology from the Philosophy Faculty at the University of Heidelberg, where he worked as a Privatdozent. Then, in 1921, he became a full professor of philosophy in Heidelberg. His first major publications were works of psychology; most notable among these were Allgemeine Psychopathologie (General Psychopathology, 1913) and Psychologie der Weltanschauungen (Psychology of World Views, 1919). The latter work was a transitional work, in which his psychological method was clearly shaped by philosophical influences and objectives, and was already evolving into a consistent philosophical doctrine. This book consequently contains many elements, albeit in inchoate form, of his later philosophy of existential authenticity.

While he was working as a psychiatrist in Heidelberg, Jaspers came into contact with Max Weber, and also with the other intellectuals who were grouped around Weber, including Ernst Bloch, Emil Lask, Georg Simmel, and Lukács. His intellectual formation was marked in a number of ways by this intellectual milieu. At a political level, he integrated aspects of Weber's enthusiasm for heroic liberalism, responsible nationalism and elite democracy into his own thought and attitudes. At a more theoretical level, his ideas were determined by the increasingly critical responses to neo-Kantian philosophy, which dominated methodological discussions around Weber and Lukács, and which subsequently coloured the intellectual horizon during World War I and throughout the Weimar Republic. This period witnessed the dethroning of neo-Kantianism as the philosophical orthodoxy in the German academic establishment, and it was marked by a proliferation of philosophical models which rejected Kantian formalism and sought to integrate experiential, historical and even sociological elements into philosophical discourse. The attempt to rescue Kantian philosophy from the legalistic formalism of the South West German School of neo-Kantian philosophy, centred around Heinrich Rickert and Wilhelm Windelband, became one of the central features of Jaspers' work, and in many ways his entire philosophical evolution was motivated by the desire to reconstruct Kantian thought, not as a formalist doctrine of self-legislation, but as an account of metaphysical experience, spontaneously decisive freedom, and authentic inner life. His early career as professor of philosophy was also deeply (and adversely) affected by neo-Kantian hostility to his work. Indeed, both neo-Kantians and phenomenological philosophers subjected his work to trenchant criticism in the early stages of his philosophical trajectory, and members of both these camps, especially Rickert and Edmund Husserl, accused him of importing anthropological and experiential questions into philosophy and thus of contaminating philosophical analysis with contents properly pertaining to other disciplines.

If Weber was the first decisive personal influence and Kant was the first decisive philosophical influence on Jaspers, in the early 1920s he encountered a further figure who assumed a decisive role in his formation: that is, Martin Heidegger. It cannot be claimed without qualification that Heidegger directly determined the conceptual structure or underlying preconditions of Jaspers' work, nor that Heidegger assimilated aspects of Jaspers' thought into his own philosophy. Throughout their theoretical trajectories, the differences between Heidegger and Jaspers were in many ways greater than the similarities. Indeed, the theoretical controversies between them eventually culminated in an embittered personal and political altercation, caused by Heidegger's publicly declared sympathy for the National Socialists in 1933. Jaspers felt himself personally threatened by Heidegger's infamous decision to support the Nazis, as he was married to a Jewish woman, and he had previously attached himself to eminent liberal politicians and philosophers, most notably Weber, who were now vilified by Heidegger and other intellectuals attached to the NSDAP. In 1933, Jaspers himself was briefly tempted into making certain incautiously optimistic statements about the Hitler regime. Indeed, these were remarks were not entirely out of keeping with his other publications of the early 1930s. In the last years of the Weimar Republic he published a controversial political work, Die geistige Situation der Zeit (The Spiritual Condition of the Age, 1931), which—to his later acute embarrassment—contained a carefully worded critique of parliamentary democracy. Throughout this period he also stressed the relevance of Weberian ideas of strong leadership for the preservation of political order in Germany. The souring of his relations with Heidegger, however, seems to have hardened his mind into a strict and sustained opposition to National Socialism, and, unlike Heidegger, his works of the 1930s avoided political themes and were largely concentrated on elaborating the interior or religious aspects of his philosophy.

Despite the at times envenomed relations between them, however, Heidegger and Jaspers are usually associated with each other as the two founding fathers of existential philosophy in Germany. This interpretation of their philosophical status and relationship is at least questionable. Heidegger resented being described as an existentialist, and Jaspers, at least after 1933, resented being identified with Heidegger. Even during their early friendship Heidegger was very critical of Jaspers' philosophy; he wrote a commentary on Psychology of World Views, in which he claimed that Jaspers' methodological approach remained ensnared in the falsehoods of subjectivist metaphysics and Cartesian ontology, and that it illegitimately introduced the categories of Weberian sociology into philosophical analysis. Similarly, throughout his life Jaspers kept a book of critical notes on Heidegger, and he routinely described Heidegger's fundamental ontology in a tone of moral-humanistic disapprobation. Nonetheless, there remains a residue of validity in the common association of Heidegger and Jaspers, and, although it requires qualification, this association is not in every respect misleading. Existentialism was, and remains, a highly diffuse theoretical movement, and it cannot be expected that two philosophers connected with this movement should hold similar views in all respects. However, existentialism had certain unifying features, and many of these were common to both Jaspers and Heidegger. In the early stages of its evolution, therefore, existentialism might be described as a theoretical stance which: a) moved philosophical discourse away from Kantian formalism and emphasized the belief that the content of thought must reside in particular experiences and decisions; b) followed Kierkegaard in defining philosophy as a passionate and deeply engaged activity, in which the integrity and the authenticity of the human being are decisively implicated; c) sought to overcome the antinomies (reason/experience; theory/praxis; transcendence/immanence; pure reason/practical reason) which determine the classical metaphysical tradition by incorporating all aspects (cognitive, practical and sensory) of human life in an encompassing account of rational and experiential existence. If this definition of existentialism is accepted, then the suggestion of a family connection between Jaspers and Heidegger cannot be entirely repudiated, for both contributed to the reorganization of philosophical questioning in the 1920s in a manner which conforms to this definition. Ultimately, however, relations between Heidegger and Jaspers degenerated to a terminal impasse, and after Wold War II Jaspers refused to explain or exonerate Heidegger's political actions during the Nazi years and he even recommended to a de-Nazification committee that Heidegger should be suspended from his university teaching responsibilities.

In 1937 Jaspers was removed from his professorship, and he surely felt himself a marked man until the end of World War II. After 1945, though, his fortunes changed dramatically, and he figured prominently on the White List of the US-American occupying forces: that is, on the list of politicians and intellectuals who were deemed untarnished by any association with the NSDAP, and who were allowed to play a public role in the process of German political re-foundation. From this time on Jaspers defined himself primarily as a popular philosopher and educator. In the first role, he contributed extensive edifying commentaries on questions of political orientation and civic morality—first, in the interim state of 1945–1949, and then, after 1949, in the early years of the Federal Republic of Germany. In the second role, as one of the professors responsible for reopening the University of Heidelberg, he wrote at length on the necessity of university reforms, he emphasized the role of liberal humanistic education as a means of disseminating democratic ideas throughout Germany, and he took a firm line against the rehabilitation of professors with a history of Nazi affiliation.

Of his post-1945 publications, therefore, Jaspers' political contributions are perhaps the most significant. His contribution to the promotion of a democratic civic culture in West Germany at this time was of great importance, and his writings and radio broadcasts shaped, in part, the gradually evolving democratic consensus of the early Federal Republic. In Die Schuldfrage (The Question of German Guilt, 1946), published at the time of the Nürnberg trials, he argued that, although not all Germans could be legitimately brought to trial for war crimes, all Germans should accept an implicit complicity in the holocaust and only the critical self-reflection of all Germans could lead to cultural and political renewal. In the 1950s, he supported the main policies of the liberal-conservative governments led by Konrad Adenauer (1949–1963), and he particular endorsed the formation of the Western Alliance, which he saw as a means of protecting the cultural resources of Western European culture from their colonization by the Soviet Union. Throughout this time, however, the cautiously conservative tenor of Jaspers' political thought was progressively modified by his frequent and at times intense intellectual exchanges with Hannah Arendt, who might well be seen as the fourth great influence on his work. Jaspers had been Arendt's tutor and supervisor before she emigrated from Germany in the 1930s, but the period after 1945 saw something of a role reversal in this relationship, which Jaspers seems to have accepted quite graciously. Influenced by Arendt's agonistic republicanism, he gradually turned against the relatively complacent spirit of political and intellectual restoration in the early Federal Republic, and he finally devoted himself to elaborating models of citizenship founded in constitutional rights and legally enshrined identities. In this respect, he can be viewed as an important precursor of Jürgen Habermas, and his works contain an early conception of the doctrine later known as constitutional patriotism. His views on German re-unification were also particularly influential; he opposed the dominant outlooks of the time by claiming that the demand for re-unification meant that German politics remained infected with the damaging traces of old geo-political ideas and ambitions, and it prevented the fundamental redirection of German political life. Finally, then, in symbolic demonstration of disgust at the persistence of pernicious political attitudes in Germany he relinquished his German citizenship, and, having earlier moved across the border to University of Basel, he became a Swiss national. In his last works, he placed himself closer to the political left, and he even argued that only a legal revolution could ensure that the German state was organized on the basis of a morally decisive constitution. He died in Basel in 1969.

2. Early Writings

Jaspers' first intervention in philosophical debate, Psychology of World Views, constructed a typology of mental attitudes, which, close to Weber's model of ideal types, was intended to provide an interpretive account of basic psychological dispositions. The underlying argument in this work is that the constitutive fact of human mental life is the division between subject and object (Subjekt-Objekt–Spaltung). Human psychological forms—or world views—are positioned as antinomical moments within this founding antinomy, and they give distinct paradigmatic expression to the relation between human subjective inclinations and freedoms and the objective phenomena which the subject encounters. Unlike Weber, however, Jaspers argued that the construction of world views is not a merely neutral process, to be judged in non-evaluative manner. Instead, all world views contain an element of pathology; they incorporate strategies of defensiveness, suppression and subterfuge, and they are concentrated around false certainties or spuriously objectivized modes of rationality, into which the human mind withdraws in order to obtain security amongst the frighteningly limitless possibilities of human existence. World views, in consequence, commonly take the form of objectivized cages (Gehäuse), in which existence hardens itself against contents and experiences which threaten to transcend or unbalance the defensive restrictions which it has placed upon its operations. Although some world views possess an unconditioned component, most world views exist as the limits of a formed mental apparatus. It is the task of psychological intervention, Jaspers thus argued, to guide human existence beyond the restricted antinomies around which it stabilizes itself, and to allow it decisively to confront the more authentic possibilities, of subjective and objective life, which it effaces through its normal rational dispositions and attitudes.

In addition to this psychological typology, Jaspers' analysis of world views also contains a wider critique of human rationality. Most modes of rationality, he suggested, are conveniently instrumental or ideological forms, which serve distinct subjective and objective functions, and they habitually stand in the way of genuine knowledge. At the same time, however, he also claimed that rationality possesses capacities of communicative integrity and phenomenological self-overcoming, and, if authentically exercised, it is able to escape its narrowly functional form, to expose itself to new contents beyond its limits and antinomies, and to elaborate new and more cognitively unified conceptual structures. He therefore indicated that formal-epistemological concepts of rationality must be expanded to recognize that experience and committed actions are formative of authentic knowledge, and that reason cannot, in Cartesian manner, be monadically dislocated from its historical, sensory, experiential and voluntaristic foundations. From the outset, therefore, Jaspers work, although methodologically marked by Weber, was also indelibly stamped by Hegel's philosophy, and it sought to integrate the preconditions of Hegel's phenomenology into a systematic psychological doctrine. Indeed, at this early stage in his development Jaspers' thought hinged on an existential—or Kierkegaardian—alteration of Hegelian philosophy. In this, he transposed the dialectical process through which Hegel accounted for the overcoming of cognitive antinomies in the emergence of self-consciousness into an analysis of cognitive formation which sees the resolution of reason's antinomies as effected through vital experiences, decisive acts of self-confrontation, or communicative transcendence.

In this early work, Jaspers introduced several concepts which assumed great importance for all his work. Most importantly, this work contains a theory of the limit (Grenze). This term designates both the habitual forms and attitudes of the human mental apparatus, and the experiences of the mind as it recognizes these attitudes as falsely objectivized moments within its antinomical structure, and as it transcends these limits by disposing itself in new ways towards itself and its objects. In his early philosophy Jaspers thus ascribed central status to ‘limit situations’ (Grenzsituationen). Limit situations are moments, usually accompanied by experiences of dread, guilt or acute anxiety, in which the human mind confronts the restrictions and pathological narrowness of its existing forms, and allows itself to abandon the securities of its limitedness, and so to enter new realm of self-consciousness. In conjunction with this, then, this work also contains a theory of the unconditioned (das Unbedingte). In this theory, Jaspers argued that limit situations are unconditioned moments of human existence, in which reason is drawn by intense impulses or imperatives, which impel it to expose itself to the limits of its consciousness and to seek higher or more reflected modes of knowledge. The unconditioned, a term transported from Kantian doctrines of synthetic regress, is thus proposed by Jaspers as a vital impetus in reason, in which reasons encounters its form as conditioned or limited and desires to transcend the limits of this form. In relation to this, then, Jaspers' early psychological work also introduced, albeit inchoately, the concept of existential communication. In this, he argued that the freedom of consciousness to overcome its limits and antinomies can only be elaborated through speech: that is, as a process in which consciousness is elevated beyond its limits through intensely engaged communication with other persons, and in which committed communication helps to suspend the prejudices and fixed attitudes of consciousness. Existentially open consciousness is therefore always communicative, and it is only where it abandons its monological structure that consciousness can fully elaborate its existential possibilities. In this early doctrine of communication, Jaspers helped to shape a wider communicative and intersubjective shift in German philosophy; indeed, the resonances of his existential hermeneutics remained palpable in the much later works of Hans-Georg Gadamer and Paul Ricoeur. Less obviously, however, in this doctrine he also guided early existential thinking away from its original association with Kierkegaard and Nietzsche and, although assimilating Kierkegaardian elements of decisiveness and impassioned commitment, he claimed that Kierkegaard's cult of interiority, centred in the speechlessness of inner life, was a miscarried attempt to envision the conditions of human authenticity. The decision for authentic self-overcoming and cognitive unity can only occur, he argued, through shared participation in dialogue.

The major publication of Jaspers' earlier period, and probably of his entire career, is the three-volume work: Philosophy (1932). In this work he retained the partly Hegelian focus of his earlier publications, and he followed the spirit of Hegelian phenomenology in providing an account of the formation of human consciousness, which grasps consciousness as proceeding from the level of immediate knowledge and progressing through a sequence of antinomies towards a level of truthfully unified reflection and self-knowledge. In this, Jaspers again accentuated the claim that the antinomies which reason encounters and resolves in its unfolding as truth are at once both cognitive and experiential antinomies, and that the lived moments of human existence are always of cognitively constitutive relevance for the formation of consciousness. These ideas in fact remained central to Jaspers' philosophy throughout its subsequent evolution. In his later philosophical works, especially Von der Wahrheit (Of Truth, 1947), he continued to give prominence to cognitive models derived from Hegelian phenomenology, and he proposed a concept of the encompassing (das Umgreifende) to determine the phenomenological gradations of thought and being. However, in addition to its concern with Hegelian themes, Philosophy also contains a fundamental reconstruction of Kantian themes, it has its foundation in a critical reconstruction of Kant's doctrine of transcendental ideas, and it is built around an endeavour to explain the elements of Kantian idealism as a systematic doctrine of subjective-metaphysical experience.

The three volumes of Philosophy bear the titles Philosophical World Orientation (volume I), The Illumination of Existence (volume II), and Metaphysics (volume III). Each volume of this book thus describes a particular way of being: orientation, existence and metaphysical transcendence are the three essential existential modalities of human life. At the same time, each volume also describes a particular way of knowing, which is correlated with a way of being: orientation is cognitively determined by objectively verifiable knowledge or by positive or scientific proof-forms, existence is determined by subjective/existential self-reflection, and transcendence is determined by the symbolic interpretation of metaphysical contents. Together, the three volumes of Philosophy are designed to show how human existence and human knowledge necessarily progress from one level of being and one level of knowledge to another, and how consciousness gradually evolves, through confrontation with its own antinomies, from an immediate and unformed state towards a condition of unity and integral self-experience. The three volumes are consequently bound together by the argument that at the level of immediate objective knowledge—of orientation in the world—human consciousness raises subjective-existential questions about itself and the grounds of its truth which it cannot resolve at this level of consciousness, and it encounters antinomies which call it to reflect existentially upon itself and to elevate it to the level of existence or existentially committed self-reflection. At this higher level of consciousness, then, existence raises metaphysical questions about itself and its origin which it cannot begin to answer without an awareness that existence is, at an originary or authentic level, transcendent, and that its truth is metaphysical.

Each level of being in Jaspers' Philosophy corresponds to one of the Kantian transcendental ideas, and the modes of thinking and knowing defining each level of existence elucidate the intellectual content of Kant's ideas. The level of orientation in the world corresponds to the idea of the unity of the world; the level of existence corresponds to the idea of the soul's immortality; the level of transcendence corresponds to the idea of God's necessary existence. However, whereas Kant saw transcendental ideas as the formal-regulative ideas of reason, serving, at most, to confer systematic organization on reason's immanent operations, Jaspers viewed transcendental ideas as realms of lived knowledge, though which consciousness passes and by whose experienced antinomies it is formed and guided to a knowledge of itself as transcendent. Jaspers thus attributed to transcendental ideas a substantial and experiential content. Ideas do not, as for Kant, simply mark the formal limits of knowledge, marking out the bounds of sense against speculative or metaphysical questions. Instead, ideas provide a constant impulsion for reason to overcome its limits, and to seek an ever more transcendent knowledge of itself, its contents and its possibilities. In his mature philosophy, therefore, Jaspers transformed the Kantian transcendental ideas into ideas of transcendence, in which consciousness apprehends and elaborates the possibility of substantial or metaphysical knowledge and self-knowledge. Central to this adjustment to Kant's conception of ideas was also an implied, yet quite fundamental critique of the key Kantian distinction between the transcendent and the transcendental. In contrast to contemporary neo-Kantian readings of Kant, which were prepared to acknowledge the ideal element in Kantian idealism only, at most, as a regulative framework, generated by reason's own autonomous functions, Jaspers argued that Kantian philosophy always at once contains and suppresses a vision of experienced transcendence, and that the Kantian ideas should be viewed as challenges to reason to think beyond the limits of its autonomy, towards new and more authentic contents, self-experiences and freedoms.

In replacing the transcendental with the transcendent, however, Jaspers did not argue that transcendent contents are obtainable as positive elements of human knowledge. On the contrary, he argued that consciousness only acquires knowledge of its transcendence by contemplating the evanescent ciphers of transcendence, which signify the absolute limits of human consciousness. These ciphers might be encountered in nature, in art, in religious symbolism, or in metaphysical philosophy. But it is characteristic of all ciphers that, in alluding to transcendence, they also withhold transcendent knowledge from consciousness, and that they can only act as indices of the impossibility of such knowledge. The attitude of consciousness which apprehends its limits and its possible transcendence can therefore only be an attitude of foundering or failing (Scheitern), and transcendence can intrude in human consciousness only as an experience of the absolute insufficiency of this consciousness for interpreting its originary or metaphysical character. At this level, then, although opposing the formality and experiential vacuity of neo-Kantianism, Jaspers also accepted the original Kantian prohibition on positive transcendent or metaphysical knowledge. He argued that consciousness always has a metaphysical orientation to be other than, or transcendent to, its existing forms, but he also claimed that this orientation can only factually culminate in a crisis of transcendence, or in a crisis of metaphysics. Although reconsolidating the metaphysical aspects of Kantian philosophy, therefore, Jaspers' own metaphysics is always a post-Kantian metaphysics: it is a negative metaphysics, which resists all suggestion that human reason might give itself an account of metaphysical essences, which defines the realm of human meaning as formed by its difference against positive metaphysical knowledge, but which nonetheless sees reason, in Kierkegaardian manner, as driven by a despairing desire for metaphysical transcendence.

Jaspers' metaphysical reconstruction of Kantian idealism has been denounced by other philosophers, most notably those in the broad milieu of the Frankfurt School, as a stage in a wider course of cognitive degeneration, which falsely translates absolute metaphysical contents into moments of human inner experience. Despite this, there are good grounds for arguing that Jaspers' metaphysics is an important critique of the fully autonomist accounts of rationality proposed by neo-Kantianism, and it even coincides with the critiques of Kantian formalism which underpinned the philosophies widely associated with the Frankfurt School. Jaspers intuited that Kantian transcendentalism suppressed a deep-lying impulse for transcendence, and this aspect of Kant's thought was badly neglected by interpreters who saw Kant's philosophy as a doctrine of pure immanence or autonomy. Adorno's later argument that Kant's transcendental idealism always contains a lament over the closure of reason against transcendence was thus anticipated by Jaspers, albeit in subjectivist terms, and Jaspers and Adorno—for all their political differences—can be placed close together as thinkers who endeavoured to revitalize the metaphysical traces in idealism. In any case, Jaspers' insistence, contra Kant and the neo-Kantians, that reason itself is not the sole source of knowledge, and that the task of reason is not proscriptively to circumscribe the sphere of its validity against transcendence, but to overcome its cognitive limits and to envision contents which cannot be generated by its own autonomous functions, deserves to be rehabilitated as an abidingly significant contribution to modern debates on metaphysics and epistemology.

3. Philosophy and Religion

The influences of Weber, Kant, Hegel and Kierkegaard are not difficult to discern in Jaspers' work. Similarly, it is also not difficult to identify the ways in which his work was influenced by Nietzsche. Jaspers borrowed from Nietzsche a psychologistic approach to philosophical perspectives, and, like Nietzsche, he tended to view philosophical claims, not as formally verifiable postulates, but as expressions of underlying mental dispositions. For this reason, he also borrowed from Nietzsche a dismissive approach to absolutized claims to truthful knowledge, and a resultant rejection of all rational purism. Most especially, however, like Heidegger, he took from Nietzsche a critical approach to the residues of metaphysics in European philosophy, and he denied the existence of essences which are external or indifferent to human experience. At the same time, however, Jaspers also clearly positioned his philosophy against many elements of the Nietzschean legacy. He was clearly opposed to the naturalistic vitalism evolving from Nietzsche's work, and his emphasis on human subjectivity as a locus of truthful transcendence meant that Kierkegaard, rather than Nietzsche, was the existential prototype for his work.

One further important formative influence on Jaspers' philosophy, however, was Schelling. Although he was at times critical of the simple mysticism and the metaphysics of natural process in Schelling's religious works, his metaphysical reconstruction of Kantian idealism rearticulated some elements of the positive philosophy of the later Schelling, and it mirrored his attempt to account for truthful knowledge as a cognitive experience in which reason is transfigured by its encounter with contents other than its own form. In this respect, Jaspers adopted from Schelling a non-identitarian model of cognitive life, which views true (or truthful) knowledge as obtained through acts of positive interpretation and revelation at the limits of rational consciousness. Unlike Schelling, he always rejected claims to absolute positive knowledge; to this extent, he remained—in the ultimate analysis—a Kantian philosopher. However, he was clearly sympathetic to Schelling's critique of formal epistemological negativism. Indeed, through his hermeneutical transformation of idealism into a metaphysics of symbolic interpretation, he might be seen, like both Schelling and Johann Georg Hamann before him, as a philosopher who was intent on re-invoking the truth of revelation, as an absolute and non-identical content of knowledge, against the rational evidences of epistemology, and so on elaborating an interpretive methodology adapted to a conception of truth as disclosed or revealed.

The discrete but important influence of Schelling on Jaspers' philosophy also provides a clue to understanding Jaspers' philosophy of religion. At one level, Jaspers was philosophically committed to a sympathetic retrieval of religious contents. He was insistent that truth can only be interpreted as an element of radical alterity in reason, or as reason's experience of its own limits. Similarly, he was insistent that the conditions of human freedom are not generated by human reason alone, but are experienced as incursions of transcendence in rational thought. For these reasons, his philosophy is sympathetic towards the primary implications of revelation theology, and it cautiously upholds the essential philosophical claim of revelation: namely, that truth is a disclosure of otherness (transcendence) to reason, or at least an interpreted moment of otherness in reason. At the same time, however, Jaspers cannot in any obvious way be described as a religious philosopher. In fact, he was very critical of revelation theology, and of orthodox religions more generally, on a number of quite separate counts. First, he argued that the centre of religion is always formed by a falsely objectivized or absolutized claim to truth, which fails to recognize that transcendence occurs in many ways, and that transcendent truths cannot be made concrete as a set of factual statements or narratives. Religious world views are therefore examples of limited mental attitudes, which seek a hold in uniform doctrine in order to evade a confrontation with the uncertainty and instability of transcendence. In positing transcendence as a realized element of revelation, religion in fact obstructs the capacity for transcendence which all people possess; religion claims to offer transcendence, but it actually obstructs it. Second, then, as the foundations of dogma and doctrinal orthodoxy, revealed truth-claims eliminate the self-critical and communicative aspect of human reason, and they undermine the dialogical preconditions of transcendence and existential self-knowledge. Jaspers thus viewed orthodox religion as an obstruction to communication, which places dogmatic limits on the common human capacity for truthfulness and transcendence. Nonetheless, as a philosopher of transcendence, he was also clear that human truthfulness, or humanity more generally, cannot be conceived without a recuperation of religious interpretive approaches and without a recognition of the fact that the founding contents of philosophy are transcendent. Much of his work, in consequence, might be construed as an attempt to free the contents of religious thinking from the dogmatic orthodoxies imposed upon these contents in the name of organized religion.

The central idea in Jaspers' philosophy of religion is the concept of philosophical faith, set out most extensively in Der Philosophische Glaube (Philosophical Faith, 1948) and Der Philophische Glaube angesichts der christlichen Offenbarung (Philosophical Faith in face of Christian Revelation, 1962). This notoriously difficult concept contains a number of quite distinct meanings. First, it means that true philosophy must be guided by a faith in the originary transcendence of human existence, and that philosophy which negatively excludes or ignores its transcendent origin falls short of the highest tasks of philosophy. Second, however, it also means that true philosophy cannot simply abandon philosophical rationality for positively disclosed truth-contents or dogma, and that the critical function of rationality has a constitutive role in the formation of absolute knowledge. In this respect, Jaspers revisited some of the controversies concerning the relation between religion and philosophy which shaped the philosophy of the Young Hegelians in the 1830s. Like the Young Hegelians, he insisted that faith needs philosophy, and faith devalues its contents wherever these are dogmatically or positively proclaimed. Third, then, this concept also indicates that the evidences of faith are always paradoxical and uncertain and that those who pursue knowledge of these contents must accept an attitude of philosophical relativism and discursive exchange: if faith results in dogmatism, it immediately undermines its claims to offer transcendent knowledge. The concept of philosophical faith is thus proposed, not as a doctrine of factual revelation or accomplished transcendence, but as a guide to transcendent communication, which balances the element of disclosure in faith with a critical philosophical veto on the absolutism of religious claims, and which consequently insists that transcendent knowledge must be accepted as relative and incomplete. In this regard, Jaspers held the religious aspects of his philosophy on a fine dialectic between theological and anthropological assertions. He implied, at one level, that purely secularist accounts of human life occlude existence against its originary transcendent possibilities and freedoms. At the same time, however, he also suggested that pure theological analysis closes humanity against the relativity and precariousness of its truths, and against the communicative processes through which these truths are disclosed. Only philosophy which can at once embrace and relativize secularism and embrace and relativize religion is able to undertake adequate existential inquiry, and philosophy which, in either direction, abandons the dialectical edge between these two commitments ceases to be genuine philosophy.

This critical-recuperative attitude towards religious inquiry was fundamental to many of the public controversies in which Jaspers engaged. The religious elements of his work came under attack from the Calvinist theologian, Karl Barth, who denounced the lack of objective religious content in his concept of transcendence. More significantly, though, Jaspers also entered into a lengthy and influential controversy with Rudolf Bultmann, the resonances of which still impact on liberal theological debate. At the centre of this debate was Jaspers' critique of Bultmann's strategy of scriptural de-mythologization: that is, his attempt to clarify the truth-contents of the scriptures by eliminating the historical or mythological elements of the New Testament, and by concentrating, in an existentially intonated exegesis, on the perennially valid and present aspects of the Bible. At the time when Bultmann first proposed this de-mythologizing approach Jaspers was widely (although erroneously) identified with the liberal wing of Protestant theology, and it was perhaps expected that he might declare sympathy for Bultmann's hermeneutical approach. Jaspers, however, turned sharply on Bultmann. He accused him, first, of propagating a false rationalism in religious debate; second, of arbitrarily dismissing the manifestations, embedded in myth, of the spiritual experiences of those living in earlier historical époques; and, third, of aligning all transcendent experiences to a standard scheme of relative value, and so of imposing a new system of orthodoxy in theology and undermining the manifold possibilities of transcendence. In opposition to Bultmann, therefore, Jaspers concluded that only a religious hermeneutic based in absolute liberality, excluding all orthodoxy, could be appropriate to the task of interpreting the transcendent contents of human life. Interpretive methods which efface the traces of historical contingency from transcendence and reduce transcendence to one predetermined religious truth, he suggested, fail to reflect on the plural and various forms in which transcendence can be interpreted, they erroneously presuppose that transcendence can be encased in the categories of one exclusive doctrine, and they undervalue the constitutive historical variability of transcendence. As a consequence, Jaspers argued implicitly for the importance of mythical or symbolic forms in religious inquiry, and he indicated that both myth and religion contain, in similar measure, the interpreted residues of transcendence. His analysis of religion culminated in a discussion of Trinitarian theology which, echoing Ludwig Feuerbach's anthropological analysis, asserted that the three parts of the trinity should be interpreted, not as factual elements of deity, but as symbolic ciphers of human possibility. In this, he ascribed particular significance to the second person of the Trinity, Jesus Christ, as a cipher for the human existential possibility of inner change, reversal and transformation. Wherever this cipher is hypostatically defined as mere positive fact of belief, he concluded however, the freedom of transcendence obtained through the sympathetic interpretation and recuperation of this cipher is obstructed.

Underlying Jaspers' interest in religion was a determination to convert the elements of religious doctrine into an account of human possibilities and freedoms. Indeed, the ambition behind his work on religion and myth was no less than to liberate transcendence from theology, and to permit an interpretive transformation of religiously conceived essences into the free moments of human self-interpretation. If his thought can truly be placed in the terrain of theological discourse, therefore, his approach to religion is one of extreme liberalism and latitudinarianism, which dismisses the claim that transcendence is exclusively or even predominantly disclosed by religion. The truth of religion, he intimated, only becomes true if it is interpreted as a human truth, not as a truth originally external or prior to humanity. In its orthodox form, however, religion normally prevents the knowledge of transcendence which it purports to offer.

4. Later Works: The Politics of Humanism

These humanistic reflections on the philosophy of religion are not isolated components of Jaspers' work. In fact, his criticism of religious dogmatism evolved in conjunction with a wider doctrine of humanism, which ultimately became the defining component of his later work. Arguably, Jaspers was always a humanist; certainly, if humanism is defined as a doctrine which seeks to account for the specificity, uniqueness and dignity of human life his work can, from the outset, be seen as a variant on philosophical humanism. The argument runs through all his early works that human beings are distinguished by the fact that they have authentic attributes of existence and transcendence—that is, by their ability to raise questions about themselves and their freedoms which cannot be posed in material or scientific terms, and by their resultant capacity for decisive reversal, self-transformation and transcendence. True humanity is thus a condition of free self-possession and transcendent authenticity. In general terms, existentialism can be divided between philosophers, such as Jean-Paul Sartre, who defined existentialism as a humanism, and those, such as Heidegger, who saw the organization of philosophy around the analysis of human determinacy as a metaphysical corruption of philosophy. Jaspers clearly belonged to the first category of existential philosophers.

In his writings after 1945, most especially in Vom Ursprung und Ziel der Geschichte (The Origin and Goal of History, 1949) and Die Atombombe und die Zukunft des Menschen (The Atom Bomb and the Future of Mankind, 1961), Jaspers structured his work quite explicitly as a humanist doctrine. From this time on, moreover, he attached greater importance to the social and collective conditions of human integrity and he tended to tone down his earlier construction of interiority as the place of human freedom. In fact, even the term Existenz became increasingly scarce in his post-1945 publications, and it was replaced, to a large extent, by ideas of shared humanity, founded, not in the decisive experiences of inner transformation, but in the resources of culture, tradition and ethically modulated political life. Central to these later works, consequently, was not only a turn towards humanistic reflection, but also an inquiry into the politics of humanism and the distinctively human preconditions of political existence.

Broadly reconstructed, in his later political work he argued that the emergence of European totalitarianism—exemplified by both National Socialism and Communism—was the result of a decline in political humanity and of an increasing primacy of modes of technical or instrumental rationality, which erode the authentic resources of human life. He therefore sought to offer an account of a human polity, able to provide an enduring bastion against totalitarian inhumanity. First, he argued, the human polity must be sustained by an integral cultural tradition, so that human beings can interpret the ciphers of their integrity in the ethical contents of a national culture. The political betrayal of humanity, he suggested, is usually flanked by, and in fact presupposes, a cultural betrayal of humanity, and totalitarian governance normally arises from the erosion or instrumental subjection of culture. In the nineteenth century Marx had argued that the reactionary malaise of German politics was caused by the fact that German society habitually allowed culture to stand in for politics and defined the relatively de-politicized educated bourgeois elite [Bildungsbürgertum] as the pillar of social order and the arbiter of progress. Jaspers responded to this characterization of Germany by claiming that societies which undermine the cultural role of the bourgeois elite are inherently unstable, and that the educated bourgeoisie has a primary role to play in upholding the preconditions of democratic culture. Second, he argued that the human polity must be based in free communication between citizens: communicative freedom is a prerequisite of public virtue. The human polity, he thus implied, is likely to be some kind of democracy, based in some degree of publicly formed consensus. Like Arendt, in fact, he concluded that social atomization creates cultures in which totalitarianism is likely to flourish, and that only unregulated debate in the public sphere can offset this latent pathology of mass society. Third, he argued that the resources of technological, scientific and economic planning employed by the political system should be kept at a minimum, and that the existence of an unplanned sphere of human interaction is necessary for the maintenance of a human political order. In this respect, he fervently opposed all tendencies towards technocratic governance, which he identified both in the Communist bloc in Eastern Europe, and in the rapidly expanding welfare state of the Federal Republic under Adenauer. Technocracy, he asserted, is the objective form of the instrumental tendencies in human reason, and if it is not counterbalanced by the integrally human resources of cultural or rational communication it is likely to result in oppressive government. In this respect, he moved close to quite standard variants on political liberalism, and he endorsed limited government, relative cultural and economic freedom, and protection for society from unaccountable political direction. Fourth, he also argued that a human polity requires a constitutional apparatus, enshrining basic rights, imposing moral-legal order on the operations of the state, and restricting the prerogative powers of the political apparatus. Like Kant, therefore, he advocated the institution of an international federation of states, with shared constitutions, laws and international courts. Fifth, however, he also retained aspects of the elite-democratic outlook which he had first inherited from Weber, and he continued to argue that the human polity must be supported and guided by reasonable persons or responsible elites.

After the traumas of National Socialism and the war, however, it is fair to say that Jaspers' political philosophy never moved finally beyond a sceptical attitude towards pure democracy, and his political writings never fully renounced the sense that German society was not sufficiently evolved to support a democracy, and Germans required education and guidance for democracy to take hold. Even in his last writings of the 1960s, in which he declared tentative support for the activities of the student movement around 1968, there remain traces of elite-democratic sympathy. For all his importance in modern German politics, therefore, his philosophy of politics was always slightly anachronistic, and his position remained embedded in the personalistic ideals of statehood which characterized the old-liberal political culture of Imperial Germany and persisted in the conservative-liberal fringes of the Weimar Republic.

Bibliography

Major Works by Jaspers

1913 Allgemeine Psychopathologie: Ein Leitfaden für Studierende, Ärzte und Psychologen, Berlin: Springer. Translated as, General Psychopathology, trans. J. Hoenig and M. W. Hamilton, Chicago: University of Chicago Press, 1963.
1919 Psychologie der Weltanschauungen, Berlin: Springer.
1923 Die Idee der Universität, Berlin: Springer. Translated as, The Idea of the University, trans. H. A. T. Reiche and H. F. Vanderschmidt, Boston: Beacon Press, 1959.
1931 Die Geistige Situation der Zeit, Berlin: de Gruyter. Translated as, Man in the Modern Age, trans. E. Paul and C. Paul, London: Routledge, 1933.
1932 Philosophie, Berlin: Springer. Translated as, Philosophy, trans. E. B. Ashton, Chicago: Chicago University Press, 1969–1971.
1935 Vernunft und Existenz, Groningen: Wolters. Translated as, Reason and Existenz, trans. W. Earle, New York: Noonday Press, 1955.
1936 Nietzsche: Einführung in das Verständnis seines Philosophierens, Berlin: de Gruyter. Translated as, Nietzsche: An Introduction to his Philosophical Activity, trans. C. F. Wallraff and F. J. Schmitz, Tucson: University of Arizona Press, 1965.
1938 Existenzphilosophie, Berlin: de Gruyter. Translated as, Philosophy of Existence, trans. R. F. Grabau, Philadelphia: University of Pennsylvania Press, 1971.
1946 Die Schuldfrage, Heidelberg: Schneider. Translated as, The Question of German Guilt, trans. E. B. Ashton, New York: The Dial Press, 1947.
1947 Von der Wahrheit, Munich: Piper.
1948 Der Philosophische Glaube, Zurich: Artemis.
1949 Vom Ursprung und Ziel der Geschichte, Zurich: Artemis. Translated as, The Origin and the Goal of History, trans. M. Bullock, New Haven: Yale University Press, 1953.
1950a Einführung in die Philosophie, Zurich: Artemis. Translated as, Way to Wisdom: An Introduction to Philosophy, trans. R. Manheim, New Haven: Yale University Press, 1951.
1950b Vernunft und Widervernunft in unserer Zeit, Munich: Piper. Translated as, Reason and Anti-Reason in our Time, trans. S. Goodman, New Haven: Yale University Press, 1952.
1954 Die Frage der Entmythologisierug (with Rudolf Bultmann), Munich: Piper. Translated as, Myth and Christianity: An Inquiry into the Possibility of Religion without Myth, trans. N. Gutermann, New York: Noonday Press, 1958.
1955 Schelling: Größe und Verhängnis, Munich: Piper.
1957 Die Großen Philosophen, volume I, Munich: Piper. Translated as, The Great Philosophers, volume I, trans. R. Manheim, New York: Harcourt, Brace & World, 1962.
1960 Freiheit und Wiedervereinigung, Munich: Piper.
1961 Die Atombombe und die Zukunft des Menschen, Munich: Deutscher Taschenbuch Verlag. Translated as, The Atom Bomb and the Future of Man, trans. E. B. Ashton, Chicago: University of Chicago Press, 1961.
1962 Der philosophische Glaube angesichts der Christlichen Offenbarung, Munich: Piper. Translated as, Philosophical Faith and Revelation, trans. E. B. Ashton, London: Collins, 1967.
1966 Wohin treibt die Bundesrepublik? Munich: Piper. Translated as, The Future of Germany, trans. E. B. Ashton, Chicago: University of Chicago Press, 1967.

Selected Secondary Literature on Jaspers in English

Academic Tools

sep man icon How to cite this entry.
sep man icon Preview the PDF version of this entry at the Friends of the SEP Society.
inpho icon Look up this entry topic at the Indiana Philosophy Ontology Project (InPhO).
phil papers icon Enhanced bibliography for this entry at PhilPapers, with links to its database.

Other Internet Resources

[Please contact the author with suggestions.]

Related Entries

Arendt, Hannah | existentialism | Hegel, Georg Wilhelm Friedrich | Kant, Immanuel | Kierkegaard, Søren | Nietzsche, Friedrich | Schelling, Friedrich Wilhelm Joseph von | Weber, Max