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The Philosophy of Music

First published Mon Oct 22, 2007; substantive revision Fri Jul 13, 2012

Philosophy of music is the study of fundamental questions about the nature of music and our experience of it. Like any ‘philosophy of X’, it presupposes a knowledge of its target area of study. However, unlike philosophy of science, say, the philosophy of an artistic practice, such as music, is one that most people have a significant background in, merely as a result of being members of a musical culture. Music plays a central role in many people's lives. Thus, as with the central questions of metaphysics and epistemology, not only can most people quickly grasp the philosophical questions music raises, they tend to have thought about some of those questions before encountering the academic discipline itself.

Music is perhaps the art that presents the most philosophical puzzles. Unlike painting, its works often have multiple instances, none of which can be identified with the work itself. Thus, the question of what exactly the work is is initially more puzzling than the same question about works of painting, which appear (at least initially) to be simple physical objects. Unlike much literature, the instances of a work are performances, which offer interpretations of the work, yet the work can also be interpreted independently of any performance, and performances themselves can be interpreted. This talk of ‘interpretation’ points to the fact that we find music an art steeped with meaning, and yet, unlike drama, pure instrumental music has no obvious semantic content. This quickly raises the question of why we should find music so valuable. Central to many philosophers' thinking on these subjects has been music's apparent ability to express emotions while remaining an abstract art in some sense.

This entry focuses almost exclusively on work in the philosophy of music that is recent – from within the last fifty years – and in an analytic vein (broadly construed). For a much broader introduction to philosophy of music, covering its history, major figures, connections with other disciplines, and a wider range of topics than can be covered here, see Gracyk & Kania 2011.

1. What Is Music?

1.1 Beyond ‘Pure’ Music

In most of this entry, the discussion focuses on ‘pure’ or ‘absolute’ music – instrumental music that has no accompanying non-musical components. Most of the philosophers whose work is discussed below also put the focus here, and there are three reasons to do so. The first is that pure music often presents the most difficult philosophical problems. It is less puzzling how a musical setting of a maudlin text could be expressive of sadness, for instance, than how a piece of music without even a programmatic text could be, since the emotional expression could somehow be transferred to the music from the text. The second reason is that, though the problems are more difficult, the solutions are likely to be more easily evaluated in the pure case. Just as apportioning blame is easier when one person is responsible for a crime than when the blame must be divided between a number of conspirators, the success of a solution to the problem of musical expressiveness will be clearer if it can explain the expressivity of pure music. Thirdly, it is certain that the expressiveness of pure music will play a role in the expressiveness of ‘impure’ music. Though a text may be able to impart some of its expressiveness to a song, for instance, the musical elements of the song must play some role. A maudlin text set to a jauntily upbeat melody in a major key will clearly not have the same overall expressivity as the same text set to a plodding dirge. Though I have used expressivity as an example here, these same points will apply to discussions of musical understanding and value. There may also be interesting questions to be asked about the ontology of ‘impure’ music, but it is not clear they will be of the same kind as those to be asked about expressivity, understanding, and value.

Given the global prevalence of rock music, broadly construed, it is plausible that song is the most common kind of music listened to in the contemporary world. Film and other motion pictures, such as television, are also ubiquitous. There has been some significant work done on the aesthetics of song (Levinson 1987, Gracyk 2001, Bicknell 2005, Bicknell & Fisher forthcoming), music drama (Levinson 1987, Kivy 1988b, 1994, Goehr 1998), and film music (Carroll 1988, 213–225; Levinson 1996c; Kivy 1997a; Smith 1996). (See also the chapters in part V of Gracyk & Kania 2011; on hybrid art forms more generally, see Levinson 1984.) However, it seems that there is plenty of room for further work on the aesthetics of impure music. ‘Muzak’ is another musical phenomenon that is ubiquitous, yet has received little serious attention from aestheticians, being used primarily as an example to elicit disgust. Whether or not there is anything interesting to say about Muzak philosophically, as opposed to psychologically or sociologically, remains to be seen.

1.2 The Definition of ‘Music’

Explications of the concept of music usually begin with the idea that music is organized sound. They go on to note that this characterization is too broad, since there are many examples of organized sound that are not music, such as human speech, and the sounds non-human animals and machines make. There are two further kinds of necessary conditions philosophers have added in attempts to fine tune the initial idea. One is an appeal to ‘tonality’ or essentially musical features such as pitch and rhythm (Scruton 1997, 1–79; Hamilton 2007, 40–65; Kania 2011a). Another is an appeal to aesthetic properties or experience (Levinson 1990b; Scruton 1997, 1–96; Hamilton 2007, 40–65). As these references make clear, one can endorse either of these conditions in isolation, or both together. It should also be noted that only Jerrold Levinson and Andrew Kania attempt definitions in terms of necessary and sufficient conditions. Both Roger Scruton and Andy Hamilton reject the possibility of a definition in terms of necessary and sufficient conditions. Hamilton explicitly asserts that the conditions he defends are ‘salient features’ of an unavoidably vague phenomenon.

The main problem with the first kind of condition is that every sound seems capable of being included in a musical performance, and thus characterizing the essentially musical features of sounds seems hopeless. (We need only consider the variety of ‘untuned’ percussion available to a conservative symphonist, though we could also consider examples of wind machines, typewriters, and toilets, in Ralph Vaughan Williams's Sinfonia Antartica, Leroy Anderson's The Typewriter, and Yoko Ono's “Toilet Piece/Unknown”.) Defenders of such a condition have turned to sophisticated intentional or subjective theories of tonality in order to overcome this problem. If the essentially musical features of a sound are not intrinsic to it, but somehow related to how it is produced or received, we can classify just one of two ‘indiscernible’ sounds as music. The details of one's theory of essentially musical features will determine how much avant-garde ‘sound art’ counts as music.

If one endorses only an aesthetic condition, and not a tonality condition, one still faces the problem of poetry – non-musical aesthetically organized sounds. Levinson, who takes this approach, excludes organized linguistic sounds explicitly (1990b). This raises the question of whether there are further distinctions to be made between arts of sound. Andy Hamilton defends a tripartite distinction, arguing that sound art, as opposed to both music and literature, was established as a significant art form in the twentieth century (2007, 40–65). This is one reason Hamilton endorses both tonal and aesthetic conditions on music; without the former, Levinson is unable to make such a distinction. On the other hand, by endorsing an aesthetic condition, Hamilton is forced to exclude scales and Muzak, for instance, from the realm of music. Kania (forthcoming a) has suggested that it is a mistake to think that music is necessarily an art, any more than language. He argues that we should distinguish music simpliciter from its artistic uses, just as we do in the cases of language and literature, depiction and painting, and so on. By means of a disjunctive condition, Kania also adds a further distinction to Hamilton's set. Kania argues that music is ‘(1) any event intentionally produced or organized (2) to be heard, and (3) either (a) to have some basic musical feature, such as pitch or rhythm, or (b) to be listened to for such features’ (2011a, 12). The latter disjunct allows for two indiscernible works, neither of which strictly possesses basic musical features, yet one of which is music and the other sound art because of the complex way in which the former is intended to be approached. Kania's approach thus draws on some of the machinery of recent definitions of art in place of an appeal to an aesthetic condition.

Having discussed additional conditions, it's worth returning to the basic idea of ‘organized sound’. Most theorists note that music does not consist entirely of sounds. Most obviously, much music includes rests. You might think that silence can function only to organize the sounds of music. One counterargument is that an understanding listener listens to the rests, just as she listens to the sounds (Kania 2010). Another is to provide putative cases of music in which the silences are not structural in the way ordinary rests are. John Cage's 4'33" is frequently discussed, though there is broad agreement that this piece is not silent – its content is rather the ambient sounds that occur during its performance. Anyway, both Stephen Davies (1997a) and Andrew Kania (2010) argue Cage's piece is not music, though on different grounds. Kania considers several other contenders for the label of ‘silent music’, arguing that there are indeed extant examples, most notably Erwin Schulhoff's “In Futurum” from his Fünf Pittoresken, which predates Cage's 4'33" by some 33 years.

2. Musical Ontology

Musical ontology is the study of the kinds of musical things there are and the relations that hold between them. The most discussed issues within this field have been the metaphysical nature of works of classical music, and what it is to give an ‘authentic performance’ of such works. Recently there has been growing interest in the ontologies of other musical traditions, such as rock and jazz, and discussion of the methodology and value of musical ontology. (For a more detailed overview of these debates, see Kania 2008a and forthcoming b.)

2.1 The Fundamentalist Debate

Musical works in the Western classical tradition are multiple entities, in the sense that they admit of multiple instances (performances). Much of the debate over the nature of such works thus reads like a recapitulation of the debate over the ‘problem of universals’; the range of proposed candidates covers the spectrum of fundamental ontological theories. We might divide musical ontologists into the realists, who posit the existence of musical works, and the anti-realists, who deny their existence. Realism has been more popular than anti-realism, but there have been many conflicting realist views. I begin with three unorthodox views before moving on to more orthodox Platonist and nominalist theories.

Idealists hold that musical works are mental entities. Collingwood (1938) and Sartre (1940) respectively take musical (and other) works to be imaginary objects and experiences. The most serious objections to this kind of view are that (i) it fails to make works intersubjectively accessible, since the number of works going under the name The Rite of Spring will be as multifarious as the imaginative experiences people have at performances with that name, and (ii) it makes the medium of the work irrelevant to an understanding of it. One might have the same imaginative experience in response to both a live performance and a recording of The Rite of Spring, yet it seems an open question whether the two media are aesthetically equivalent.

David Davies argues that musical works, like all works of art, are actions, in particular the compositional actions of their composers (2004). Thus he revives what we might call an ‘action theory’ of the ontology of art. (An earlier defender of such a view is Gregory Currie (1989), who argues that artworks are types of action, rather than the particular actions with which Davies identifies them.) Although deciding between theories of musical ontology is always to some extent a matter of finding a balance between the benefits of a theory and its cost in terms of our pre-theoretic intuitions, action theories have a particularly hard row to hoe since they imply that an instance of a work is some action performed by a composer, rather than a performance. In order to make up for such damage to our intuitions the theoretical benefits of an action theory will have to be quite extensive.

Guy Rohrbaugh has proposed a new ontological category for musical, and other multiple works of art (2003). He argues that since the kinds of things we attribute to musical and other art works, such as modal and temporal flexibility, cannot be accounted for by any extant ontological theory and, moreover, that these problems arise not just for artworks, but such things as ‘species..., clubs, sorts of artifact, and words’ (199), we are justified in positing a new kind of entity: a historical individual that is ‘embodied in’, but not constituted by, physical things, such as scores and performances. (For criticism of this view, see Dodd 2007, 143–66.)

Most theorists seem to think that some kind of Platonist or nominalist theory of musical works is more plausible than those so far considered. Nominalists hold that musical works are collections of concrete particulars, such as scores and performances (Goodman 1968, Predelli 1995, 1999a, 1999b, 2001, Caplan and Matheson 2006). While this view is attractive because it appeals only to the least problematic kinds of entities, it faces serious challenges. Though many of our claims about musical works may be paraphrasable into claims about sets of possible performances, some seem to make intractable reference to works. For instance, most performances of The Rite of Spring – even including the possible ones – include several wrong notes. Thus it is difficult to imagine how the paraphrase schema will avoid the nonsensical conclusion that The Rite of Spring contains several wrong notes. The solution to this problem seems to lie in an appeal to the work as independent of its various performances, but such an appeal seems unavailable to the nominalist. (For a recent defense of nominalist theories against some standard objections, see Tillman 2011.)

Platonism, the view that musical works are abstract objects, is currently the most popular view, since it respects more of our pre-theoretic intuitions about musical works than any of the other theories. On the other hand, it is the most ontologically puzzling, since abstract objects are not well understood. Nonetheless, Platonism has been tenacious, with much of the debate centering around what variety of abstract object musical works are. What we might call ‘simple Platonism’ (known simply as ‘Platonism’ in the literature), is that works are eternal existents, existing in neither space nor time (Kivy 1983a, 1983b, Dodd 2000, 2002, 2007). According to ‘complex Platonism’, musical works come to exist in time as the result of human action. The view is motivated by a number of features of musical practice, including the intuition that musical works are creatable, the attribution of various aesthetic and artistic properties to works, and the fine-grained individuation of works and performances (e.g. in terms of who composed them, or what instruments they are properly performed upon) (Ingarden 1986; Thomasson 2004b; Wolterstorff 1980; Wollheim 1968, 1–10, 74–84; Levinson 1980, 1990c; S. Davies 2001, 37–43; Howell 2002; Stecker 2003, 84–92).

In contrast to all these realists views stand those of the anti-realists, who deny there are any such things as musical works. An early proponent of such a view is Richard Rudner (1950), though it is difficult to say whether he is best interpreted as an eliminativist or a fictionalist, the two anti-realist views currently on the table. According to eliminativists, there are no such things as musical works, and thus we ought to stop trying to refer to them. Ross Cameron (2008) defends such a view, but only with respect to ‘Ontologese’ – the language we speak when we do ontology. He argues ordinary English locutions such as ‘there are many musical works’ can be true without there being any musical works. (For critical discussion, see Predelli 2009 and Stecker 2009.) According to fictionalists, the value of discourse about musical works is not truth, and thus we ought not to abandon the discourse despite the non-existence of its subject matter, but rather adopt a different, make-believe attitude towards it (or perhaps we already do so). (See Kania 2008c, forthcoming b.)

Much of this debate over the fundamental ontological category to which musical works belong has turned on ‘technical’ issues, that is, controversial general metaphysical claims about the nature of properties, causation, embodiment, and so on (e.g. Howell 2002, Trivedi 2002, Caplan and Matheson 2004, 2006, Dodd 2007, Cameron 2008). In the face of this, some theorists have pointed out that musical works are cultural entities, and thus the methodology appropriate to uncovering their ontological status might be quite different from that of general metaphysics (Goehr 1992, S. Davies 2003c, D. Davies 2004, Thomasson 2006, Kania 2008c). There currently seems to be as much interest in the methodological questions as in first-order theorizing. (For recent examples, see Kania 2008c, D. Davies 2009, Predelli 2009, Stecker 2009, Dodd 2010.)

2.2 Higher-level Ontological Issues

It might seem that, since musical works are multiple entities, once we have figured out their true nature, we will know what relation holds between the work and its instances. However, since the fundamentalist debate is about the basic ontological category to which works belong, resolving that debate will leave open many questions about the instantiation relation. For instance, is the use of a harpsichord required to instance Bach's Brandenburg Concerto No. 5 in performance? Would producing harpsichord-like sounds on a synthesizer do just as well? What about using another keyboard instrument from Bach's time, or a modern piano? Learning that musical works are, say, eternal types will not necessarily help settle this issue of ‘authentic performance’, which is perhaps the most discussed ontological issue, of interest to philosophers, musicologists, musicians, and audiences alike.

There have been two sources of widespread confusion in the debate over authenticity in performance. One is a failure to recognize that authenticity is not simply a property, but a relation that comes in degrees and along different ‘vectors’. Something may be more authentic in one regard and less authentic in another (S. Davies 2001, 203–5). Another is the assumption that authenticity is an evaluative concept, in the sense that ‘authentic’ implies ‘good’. That this is not the case is clear from the fact that an authentic murderer is not a good thing (S. Davies 2001, 204). Thus, our value judgments will be complex functions of the extent to which we judge performances authentic in various regards, and the values we assign to those various kinds of authenticity.

The central kind of authenticity that has been discussed is authenticity with respect to the instantiation of the work. Most agree that the fullest such authenticity requires the production of the right pitches in the right order. Pure sonicists argue this is sufficient (e.g., Kivy 1988a). Timbral sonicists argue that these pitches must also have timbres reflecting the composer's instrumentation (e.g., Dodd 2007, 201–39). Instrumentalists argue that such sounds must be produced on the kinds of instruments specified in the score (e.g., Levinson 1990d). Much of the debate is over what kinds of aesthetic or artistic properties are essential to musical works. If the limpid textures of Bach's Brandenburg Concerto No. 5 are essential to it, then one cannot authentically instance the work using a grand piano instead of a harpsichord. As such, the debate reflects a wider one in aesthetics, musical and otherwise, between formalists (or empiricists, or structuralists), who believe that the most important properties of a work are intrinsic ones, accessible to listeners unaware of the historical and artistic context in which it was created, and contextualists, who believe that a work is strongly tied to its context of creation. Stephen Davies has argued for a strong contextualism, claiming that one cannot give a single answer to the question of whether particular instrumentation is required for the fully authentic instantiation of a work. Works can be ontologically ‘thicker’ or ‘thinner’ as a result of the specifications of a composer working within certain conventions (1991, 2001). The more properties of an authentic performance a particular work specifies, the thicker it is. Thus for some works (typically earlier in the history of Western music) instrumentation is flexible, while for others (for example, Romantic symphonies) quite specific instrumentation is required for fully authentic performances.

In addition to the question of what constitutes authenticity, there has been debate over its attainability and value. Those who question its attainability point to our historical distance from the creation of some works (Young 1988). We may no longer be able to read the notation in which the work is recorded, or construct or play the instruments for which it was written. If so, full authenticity is not attainable. But we rarely have no idea about these matters, and thus we might achieve partial authenticity (S. Davies 2001, 228–34). Those who question the value of authenticity often target kinds other than work-instantiation. For instance, one might question the value of producing a performance that authentically captures the sound of performances as they took place in the context of a work's composition, on the basis that musicians were not as highly skilled then as now, for instance (Young 1988, 229–31). Such arguments, though, have no consequences for the value of work-instantiation. Some argue that although we might attain an authentic instance of a work, the idea that we might thereby hear the work as its contemporaries heard it is wishful thinking, since the musical culture in which we are immersed enforces ways of listening upon us that we cannot escape (Young 1988, 232–7). Thus the point of such authenticity is questioned. In response, we may consider not only the possibility that we are in a better position to appreciate historical works than contemporary ones, but also the remarkable flexibility people seem to show in enjoying many different kinds of music from throughout history and the world (S. Davies 2001, 234–7).

(For an excellent overview of the authentic performance debate, see S. Davies 2001, 201–53. For an investigation of authenticity with respect to things other than instantiation of the work, see Kivy 1995, Gracyk 2001, Bicknell 2005, 2007a. Some recent work has, like the fundamentalist debate, taken a methodological turn; see S. Davies 2008, Dodd 2010.)

A second area that is independent of the fundamentalist debate is that of comparative ontology. Just as classical works from different historical periods may be ontologically diverse, so may works from different contemporary traditions. Theodore Gracyk has argued that instances of works of rock music are not performances. Rather, the work is instanced by playing a copy of a recording on an appropriate device (1996). Stephen Davies has argued that rock is more like classical music than Gracyk acknowledges, with works for performance at the heart of the tradition, albeit works for a different kind of performance (2001, 30–6). One can defend Gracyk by trying to find a place for live performance and performance skill within his basic framework (Kania 2006).

Work on the ontology of jazz has centered around the nature of improvisation, particularly the relation between improvisation and composition (Alperson 1984, 1998, Valone 1985, Brown 1996, 2000, Hagberg 1998, Gould and Keaton 2000, Sterritt 2000, and Young and Matheson 2000). Even apart from widening the scope of the philosophical discussion of music, this has been a useful reminder that not all music is the performance of pre-composed works (Wolterstorff 1987, 115–29). However, it must be noted that improvisation can occur within the context of such a work, as in the performance of an improvised cadenza in a classical concerto. Some have argued that there is not as significant a distinction between improvisation and composition as is usually thought (Alperson 1984). Others have argued that all performance requires improvisation (Gould and Keaton 2000). Yet others restrict the possibility of improvisation to certain kinds of musical properties, such as ‘structural’ rather than ‘expressive’ ones (Young and Matheson 2000). However, the arguments are not compelling. Usually they turn on equivocal use of terms such as ‘composition’ and ‘performance’, or beg the question by defining improvisation in terms of deviation from a score or variation of a limited set of ‘expressive’ properties.

Though jazz is not necessarily improvisational, and very few jazz performances lack any sort of prior compositional process, the centrality of improvisation to jazz presents a challenge to the musical ontologist. One might argue that jazz works are ontologically like classical works – composed for multiple, different performances – but that they tend to be thinner, leaving more room for improvisation (Gould and Keaton 2000, Young and Matheson 2000). The difficulty is to specify the work without conflating one work with another, since tokening the melody is not required, and many works share the same harmonic structure. As a result, some argue that the performance is itself the work (Alperson 1984; Hagberg 2002; S. Davies 2001, 16–19; 2003, 156). One problem here is parity with classical music. If jazz performances are musical works in their own right, it is difficult to deny that status to classical performances of works. This seems to multiply works beyond what we usually think is necessary. A third possibility is that in jazz there are no works, only performances (Brown 1996; 2000, 115; Kania 2011b). This is counterintuitive if ‘work’ is an evaluative term, but it is not obvious that this is the case.

A third topic of ontological discussion at the ‘higher’ level is the nature of the elements of musical works, such as melodies, harmonies, and rhythms, and how they come together to form complex wholes. At present only Roger Scruton (1997, 19–79; forthcoming) and Stephen Davies (2001, 47–71) have addressed these questions in any depth, but they will be important to understanding the very nature of music, if an appeal is made to such ‘basic musical features’ as pitch and rhythm in the definition of music (see section 1.2, above).

2.3 Scepticism about Musical Ontology

Several philosophers have expressed scepticism about the possibility and value of studying musical ontology. Aaron Ridley (2003a; 2004, 105–31) argues that such study is a waste of time. He argues (i) that there aren't any genuine ontological puzzles about music, (ii) that musical ontology depends on musical value judgments, and thus (iii) that musical ontology has no implications for musical aesthetics. The first claim is itself puzzling, since it is hard to understand why there would be such disagreement among philosophers about the ontology of music if there were easy answers available. Moreover, Ridley does not set out the supposedly obvious ontology of music, but rather makes substantive and contentious ontological assumptions throughout his argument. His second claim is questionable, since it seems that, like many other things, one can only correctly judge the value of something in terms of the kind of thing it really is (Walton 1970, 1988), and the kinds of things musical works, performances, and so on, are is precisely the central question of musical ontology. If Ridley is wrong about his second claim, then he is wrong about his third. However, it might be argued that some debates in musical ontology are more distantly connected to questions of musical value than others. For instance, while the debate over authentic performance is closely related to the question of the relative value of different performances, the debate over the fundamental ontological category of musical works seems more neutral with respect to that same question. (For further discussion of Ridley's scepticism, see Kania 2008b, Bartel 2011.) Lee B. Brown (2011) argues for similar conclusions with respect to ontological theories of particular musical traditions, such as rock or jazz. The discussion continues in Kania 2012 and Brown 2012.

Amie Thomasson has expressed a more measured scepticism about certain art-ontological debates (2004a, 2005, 2006). She points out that in grounding (and re-grounding) an artistic kind-term, such as ‘symphony’, there is a problem of identifying the kind of thing one intends to pick out with the term. (This is an instance of a more general ‘qua-problem’. For instance, when naming your car, there is a question about how you can successfully name the whole thing, rather than just the windshield, or a temporal part of the car, and so on.) Thus, one must have some basic ontological sortal in mind which determines the identity and persistence conditions of the thing being picked out. Since art-kinds are determined through widespread social practices, the way to discover the basic sortal is to investigate artistic practice. Thomasson's scepticism arises from her view that our artistic practices may be vague or incomplete with respect to some questions, such as how many notes one can get wrong before simply failing to perform a certain work. On the other hand, the answers to some questions are unequivocally revealed by our practice, according to Thomasson, such as that musical works are created. Thus, while her theory is sceptical about some issues, it is quite the opposite about others, ruling certain theories, such as Platonism, out of court.

One worry for Thomasson's view is that artistic practice might be even messier than she supposes. If artistic practice offers not just vague or incomplete, but contradictory answers to some questions, then it is presumably the ontologist's job to offer a theory that is the best overall reflective reconstruction of the practice (Dodd 2005, 2010). The view might also be criticized from a different direction. Even if artistic practice implies unequivocally that musical works are created abstracta, if it can convincingly be shown that there are no such things as created abstracta, then practice must be wrong. This strategy raises once more the question of the nature of musical works, and whether traditional forms of metaphysical argument are appropriate in the cultural realm. (See the references at the end of section 2.1, above.)

3. Music and the Emotions

The most widely discussed philosophical question concerning music and the emotions is that of how music can express emotions. (For a thorough treatment of this question, see S. Davies 1994 and part II of Gracyk & Kania 2011.) There is a second group of questions centered around listeners' emotional responses to music. These include questions about why and how we respond emotionally to music, the value of such responses, and why we choose to listen to music that elicits ‘negative’ responses from us, such as sadness. Theorists typically restrict themselves to ‘pure’ or ‘absolute’ music for simplicity, though it is surprising how many central examples fall outside this boundary through being program music or song. The reason given for the restriction is usually that it is easier to understand how music with an accompanying text, say, could express the emotions evident in the text. On the other hand, an important criterion for the evaluation of such music is how appropriately the composer has set her chosen text to music. So an accompanying text is clearly not sufficient for the musical expression of an emotion. Thus, a better reason for initially putting such music to one side is that the interrelation of music and text, or other elements, is likely to be highly complex, and best approached with as well-developed a theory of the more basic phenomenon in hand as possible.

3.1 Emotions in the Music

Pieces of music, or performances of them, are standardly said to be happy, sad, and so on. Music's emotional expressivity is a philosophical problem since the paradigm expressers of emotions are psychological agents, who have emotions to express. Neither pieces of music, nor performances of them, are psychological agents, thus it is puzzling that such things could be said to express emotions. One immediately helpful distinction is that between expression and expressivity, or expressiveness. Expression is something persons do, namely, the outward manifestation of their emotional states. Expressivity is something artworks, and possibly other things, possess. It is presumably related in some way to expression, and yet cannot simply be expression for the reason just given. Most theorists also distinguish between expressivity and representation, claiming that music is expressive of emotions, rather than representing them. To give a non-musical example, one might paint a person crying, yet do so in a clinical style such that the painting represents the person's sadness, yet is itself not a sad painting, that is, expressive of sadness, but rather a cool, detached one. The emotions in a piece of music are thus more closely tied to it than mere descriptions of emotional states, yet not so closely related as to count as expressions of emotion simpliciter.

An obvious way to connect expressivity with expression is to argue that pieces of music or performances of them are expressions of emotion – not the piece's or performance's emotions, but rather those of the composer or performer. There are two major problems with this ‘expression theory’. The first is that neither composers nor performers often experience the emotions their music is expressive of as it is produced. Nor does it seem unlikely that a composer could create, or a performer perform, a piece expressive of an emotion that she had never experienced. This is not to deny that a composer could write a piece expressive of her emotional state, but two things must be observed. The first is that for the expression theory to be an account of musical expressivity, at least all central cases of expressivity must follow this model, which is not the case. The second is that if a composer is to express her sadness, say, by writing a sad piece, she must write the right kind of piece. In other words, if she is a bad composer she might fail to express her emotion. This brings us to the second major problem for the expression theory. If a composer can fail to express her emotions in a piece, then the music she writes is expressive independently of the emotion she is experiencing. Thus music's expressivity cannot be explained in terms of direct expression.

Those usually cited as classic expression theorists include Tolstoy (1898), Dewey (1934), and Collingwood (1938). (One classic critique is Tormey 1971, 97–127.) These theorists have been defended in recent discussions, however, from accusations that they hold the simple view outlined above. See, for example, Ridley 2003b and Robinson 2005, 229–57. Jenefer Robinson has attempted to revive the expression theory, though she defends it as an interesting and valuable use of music's expressivity, rather than an account of expressivity itself (2005, 229–347; 2011).

A second way to link music's expressiveness with actual felt emotions is through the audience. The ‘arousal theory’ is, at its simplest, the claim that the expressiveness of a passage of music amounts to its tendency to arouse that emotion in an understanding listener. Some problems with this simple version can be overcome. For instance, some emotions, such as fear, require a particular kind of intentional object (something threatening), yet there is no such object at hand when we hear fearful music. Thus it seems implausible to claim the music's fearfulness resides in its arousal of fear in us. But the arousalist can broaden the class of aroused emotions to include appropriate responses to the expressed emotion, such as pity. It can also be objected that many understanding listeners are not moved to respond emotionally to music. But the arousalist can simply restrict the class of listener to which his theory appeals to those who are so moved. The main problem with the theory seems more intractable. Essentially it is that in order for a listener to respond appropriately to the music, she must discern the emotion expressed therein. This is most obvious when the response is a sympathetic, rather than empathetic, one. The listener's response depends upon the emotion expressed, and thus the expressivity of the music cannot depend upon that response. (A sophisticated defense of the arousal theory is to be found in Matravers 1998, 145–224, though see the second thoughts in Matravers 2011.)

Despite the problems of the arousal theory as the whole story of musical expressivity, there is a growing consensus, thanks largely to the work of Jenefer Robinson (1994, 2005), that our lower-level, less cognitive responses to music must play some role in the emotional expressivity we attribute to it. However, this role is likely to be a causal one, rather than part of an analysis of what it is for music to be emotionally expressive.

At the other end of the spectrum from the expression and arousal theories is ‘associationism’ – the theory that music's expressivity is a matter of conventional association of certain musical elements, such as slow tempi, with certain emotional states, such as sadness. Again, though associations must play some role in some cases of expression – for instance, cases of particular musical instruments, such as the snare drum, being associated with particular situations, such as war – this role is likely to be a peripheral one. The main reason is the logical-priority problem, already encountered by the arousal theory. The expressivity of music seems closely related to the resemblance between the dynamic character of both the music and the emotions it is expressive of. It is implausible that funeral marches might just as easily have been in quick-paced compound-time. Even in such cases as the snare drum, it seems possible that the instrument was chosen for the battlefield in part due to the expressive character of its sonic profile.

The cliché that music is ‘the language of the emotions’ is often considered as a possible starting point for a theory of musical expressivity. The idea combines the attractive simplicity of conventionality that associationism makes the basis of music's meaning with the idea that music's order is to be understood in terms of syntax. (See Lerdahl and Jackendoff 1983 for a theory along the latter lines.) However, although Deryck Cooke (1959) and Leonard Meyer (1956) are often cited as proponents, it is not clear that anyone holds a full-blown version of the theory. The central problem is the great disparities between language and music, in terms of the ways in which each is both syntactic and semantic (Jackendoff 2011). A serious subsidiary problem is that even if music were about the emotions in the way that language can be, that would not account for music's expressivity. The sentence ‘I am sad’ is about the emotions, but it is not expressive of sadness in the way a sad face is, though I could use either to express my sadness. Most people agree that music's relation to emotion is more like that of a sad face than that of a sentence. (This last criticism is also applicable to Susanne Langer's theory (1953) that music is about the emotions in a symbolic yet non-linguistic way.)

Several theorists have defended accounts of musical expressivity known variously as resemblance, contour, or appearance theories (e.g., Budd 1995, 133–54; S. Davies 1994, 221–67; Kivy 1989, though see Kivy 2002, 31–48 for recent qualms). The central idea is that music's expressiveness consists in the resemblance of its dynamic character to the dynamic character of various aspects of human beings undergoing emotions. The aspects appealed to include the phenomenology of the experience of the emotion, the emotion's typical facial expression, the contour of vocal expression typical of a person experiencing the emotion, and the contour of bodily behavior typical of such a person, including ‘gait, attitude, air, carriage, posture, and comportment’ (S. Davies 2006, 182). Stephen Davies argues that such theories hold music to be expressive in a literal albeit secondary sense of the term. We say that a piece of music is sad in the same sense in which we say that a weeping willow is sad (S. Davies 2006, 183). Such uses are no more metaphorical than a claim that a chair has arms.

Jerrold Levinson concedes that there is an important resemblance between the contour of music expressive of an emotion and the contour of typical behavioral expressions of that emotion. He objects, however, that such an account cannot be the whole, or even the most fundamental part of the story (Levinson 1996b, 2006c). He drives in a wedge precisely at the point where an appeal is made to the resemblance between the music and typical behavioral expressions. He asks what the manner and extent of the resemblance between the two must be, precisely, in order for the music to count as expressive of some emotion. After all, as is often said, everything resembles everything else in all sorts of ways, and so one could point out many resemblances between a funeral march and an expression of joy, or for that matter a cup of coffee and sadness. The resemblance theorist must give some account of why the funeral march, and not the cup of coffee, is expressive of sadness, and not joy. Levinson claims that the obvious suggestion here is that the funeral march is ‘readily-hearable-as’ an expression of sadness. If this is correct, then the resemblance the music bears to emotional behavior is logically secondary – a cause or ground of its expressivity. The expressivity itself resides in the music's disposition to elicit the imaginative response in us of hearing the music as a literal expression of emotion. As a logical consequence, the imaginative experience prompted must include some agent whose expression the music literally is.

In reply to this kind of objection, Stephen Davies has emphasized the role of the listener's response in resemblance theories. Such responses have always been appealed to by such theories, as evidenced by Malcolm Budd's talk of ‘hearing as’ (1995, 135–7), and Peter Kivy's discussion of our tendency to ‘animate’ that which we perceive (1980, 57–9). But Davies now makes the appeal quite explicit and central, devoting as much space to explication of the response-dependent nature of expressivity as to the role of resemblance (2006). To the extent that the response is one of imaginative animation, there will be agreement between Levinson and the resemblance theorist. But Davies, at least, continues to resist Levinson's theory of imagined literal expression on two fronts.

The first is in his refusal to accord a role to imagination in our response to expressive music. For Davies, the response of the appropriate listener upon which the expressivity of the music depends is one of an experience of resemblance (2006, 181–2). In other words, the answer to the question of the manner and extent to which music must resemble some behavioral expression in order to qualify as expressive of a particular emotion is simply ‘in whatever manner and to whatever extent leads us to experience the music as resembling the emotion’. No further attempt at analysis is given, presumably because Davies believes this is the end of the philosophical line. Further explanation of our tendency to respond in this way to music will be in some other domain, such as the psychology of music. Since Davies's theory posits at base a contour-recognition experience while Levinson's posits an imaginative experience of expression, the link between literal expression and musical expressivity looks closer in Levinson's theory than in Davies's. An empirical consequence seems to be that Davies's theory will predict weaker emotional responses to music than Levinson's. Whether or not this is an advantage or disadvantage of the theory depends on the empirical facts about how we respond emotionally to music.

On the second front Davies is more aggressive. He attacks the idea that we imagine a persona inhabiting the music, or giving rise to it in some way as the literal expression of its emotional experiences (1997b; 2006, 189–90; see also Kivy 2002, 135–59; 2006; Ridley 2007). The simplest objection is that there is empirical evidence that understanding listeners do not engage in any such imaginative activity. This is decisive if true, but there is plenty of room to quibble about our ability to test for the right kinds of imaginative activity, the selection of the subjects, and so on. A different kind of objection is that if the persona theory were true, expressive music could not constrain our imaginative activity in such a way as to yield convergent judgments of expressiveness among understanding listeners. That is, different people, or the same person on different occasions, could imagine a single passage as the expression of an imagined agent's anger, excitement, passionate love, and so on. The problem is compounded when we consider the narrative(s) that we might imagine to explain the agent's (or agents') emotional progress in an extended work. It is not clear even how we might individuate one such agent from another, reidentify an agent over time, and so on. These criticisms seem a little uncharitable. As mentioned above, Levinson is open to a resemblance account's playing an important role in our identification of the particular emotions expressed in a passage. So Levinson can simply help himself to whatever level of specificity of emotions expressed the best resemblance account has to offer. As for the individuation and reidentification of the imagined agents, no mention has been made of such complexities so far, and as Levinson says, these ‘are matters on which the account of basic musical expressiveness can remain agnostic’ (2006c, 204).

Since both the resemblance and ready-hearability theories make music's expressiveness a matter of response-dependence, both must answer the question of whose responses are to be taken into account. Both appeal to listeners with understanding of the kind of music under discussion. This raises the question of what counts as understanding (a matter considered in section 4, below). One thing that cannot be appealed to in this connection, though, is an ability to hear the right emotional expressivity in music, for this would render any account circular. Levinson points out that one can appeal to everything but such understanding of expressivity, and thinks that sensitivity to expressivity will come along with the rest (1996b, 109). Aside from this, though, there is the fact that some apparently understanding listeners simply deny that music is expressive of emotion. Levinson thinks we can reasonably exclude such listeners from the class whose responses are appealed to in the analysis of expressiveness, since only those generally disposed to hear expressiveness are reasonably appealed to in determining the specific expressiveness of a particular passage, which are the terms in which he puts his theory.

This suggestion raises the specter of an ‘error theory’ of music's expressivity, that is, a theory that all claims of emotional expressivity in music are strictly false. A major burden of such a theory is to explain away the widespread tendency to describe music in emotional terms. This has been attempted by arguing that such descriptions are shorthand or metaphor for purely sonic features (Urmson 1973), basic dynamic features (Hanslick 1986), purely musical features (Sharpe 1982), or aesthetic properties (Zangwill 2007). There are many problems with such views. For one thing, they are committed to some sort of scheme for reduction of expressive predicates to other terms, such as sonic or musical ones, and such a scheme is difficult to imagine (Budd 1985a, 31–6). For another, anyone not drawn to this theory is likely to reject the claim that the paraphrase captures all that is of interest and value about the passage described, precisely since it omits the expressive predicates (Davies 1994, 153–4). However, the possibility that a musical culture might fall into the grip of anti-expressivist formalism raises questions about contextualism. Perhaps Levinson, Davies, et al., are right that most people hear most music as emotionally expressive. It is a nice question, however, whether, if our musical culture fell into the grip of anti-expressivist formalism – in the future or the past – it would be appropriate to exclude ourselves from the reference class of listeners appealed to by such theories as those of Davies and Levinson. If so, this would point to a kind of high-level contextualism, or cultural relativity about the expressivity of music, making it a more contingent matter than most theorists imply. On the other hand, such an occurrence may be unlikely if our tendency to ‘animate’ non-sentient objects is deeply rooted in our biology.

3.2 Emotions in the Listener

There are two main questions asked about our emotional responses to pure music. The first is analogous to the ‘paradox of fiction’. It is not clear why we should respond emotionally to expressive music when we know that no one is undergoing the emotions expressed. The second is a variant of the ‘paradox of tragedy’. If some music arouses ‘negative’ emotional responses in us, such as sadness, why do we seek out the experience of such music? These questions are addressed in turn.

One might simply deny that we respond emotionally to music. R. A. Sharpe (2000, 1–83), while stopping short of outright denial, suggests that our emotional responses to music are a much smaller component of our understanding experience of it than the philosophical literature on the topic would suggest. (See also Zangwill 2004.) Peter Kivy (1999) goes almost all the way, arguing that those who report emotional reactions to music are confusing the pleasure they take in the beauty of the music, in all its expressive individuality, with the feeling of the emotion expressed.

Though most philosophers appeal to typical experience and empirical data to reject the plausibility of Kivy's position, they admit the problem that motivates it, namely, the conceptual tension between the nature of music and the nature of the emotions we feel in response to it. To elaborate, there is some consensus that emotions are cognitive, in the sense that they take intentional objects – they are about things – and that the nature of a given emotion's intentional object is constrained. For instance, in order to feel fear, one must believe that there is something (the intentional object) that is threatening. When one listens to a sad piece of music, however, one knows there is nothing literally feeling an emotion of sadness, and thus it is puzzling that one should be made sad by the experience.

Part of the puzzle can be resolved by acknowledging that not all emotional responses (broadly construed) are cognitive (Robinson 1994; 2005, 387–400). For instance, it is no more puzzling that one could be startled by a fortissimo blow to a bass drum than that one could so respond to a thunderclap. Similarly, we might respond non-cognitively to basic musical elements such as tension and release just as we do to the tension we observe in a balloon being over-inflated, or to the release of doves into the air.

As for higher-order emotional responses, there are at least two possible explanations. One appeals to the phenomenon of ‘emotional contagion’ or ‘mirroring responses’ (Davies 1994, 279–307; 2006, 186–8). When surrounded by moping people, one tends to become sad. Moreover, such a ‘mood’ is not about some intentional object. One is not necessarily sad for the mopers, nor whatever they are sad about, if anything. Similarly, when ‘surrounded’ by music that presents an appearance of sadness, one might become sad, but not sad about the music, or anything else (Radford 1991). Jenefer Robinson has objected that such contagion is only well documented as a form of non-cognitive response, and in response to restricted cues: ‘After all, if living with a basset hound were like living with a depressed person, would normal folk choose a basset hound as their life's companion?’ (2005, 387–8). But it may be that music's dynamic character is enough for it to cross the threshold into the realm of resemblances which elicit mirroring responses from us.

The ready-hearability theorist is at a slight advantage in accounting for our emotional responses to music's expressivity, since according to that theory one imagines that the music is a literal expression of emotion. This means that emotional responses to music's expressivity are no more puzzling than emotional responses to other expressive imagined agents, such as fictional characters in novels. The advantage is only slight because the question of how and why we respond emotionally to fictions is itself a philosophical problem of some magnitude. Nonetheless, there are several theories available (though this is not the place to go into them). One difficulty with appealing to a solution to this ‘paradox of fiction’ is that it is not clear our emotional responses to the expressivity of music are the same as those to emotionally expressive characters. For instance, the standard example of an emotional response to music is being made sad by a funeral march, while the standard example of emotional response to fiction is (something like) to feel pity for a sad character. If the former is to be explained in the same way as the latter, we would expect listeners to feel pity in response to the funeral march (pity for the persona imagined to be expressing herself through it). However, it seems reasonable to ask for more detailed examples since, on the one hand, we surely do feel sad in response to tragedy and, on the other, it is not obvious that we do not feel pity (or imagined pity, or whatever one's preferred theory of emotional response to fiction posits) in response to tragic music.

Leaving behind our consideration of how and why we respond emotionally to pure music, we turn to the question of why we seek out music that arouses ‘negative’ emotions in us, such as sadness, assuming henceforth that we are in fact aroused to such emotions. (Since this problem is a close analog of the ‘paradox of tragedy’, some of the references below are to literature not explicitly about music, but the transposition of the arguments to music is not difficult to imagine.) One obvious suggestion is that our negative emotional response is a price we are willing to pay for the other benefits of engaging with the piece in question, such as (but not limited to) ‘positive’ emotional responses. While this sort of reasoning may play a role, it cannot be a complete solution, since for most pieces that elicit negative responses there are many others that elicit fewer, or less intense negative responses for the same positive payoff. More sophisticated versions of the same suggestion argue for a more intimate link between the negative emotional response and the payoff. One such is that we cannot understand the work we are engaging with without understanding its expressivity, which brings the negative response with it (Goodman 1968, 247–51; Davies 1994, 311–20; Goldman 1995, 68; Robinson 2005, 348–78). Closely related is the benefit of an aesthetic or artistic appreciation of the expressivity responsible for the negative response.

Shifting focus from benefits located in the expressive work to those located in the emotional listener, the oldest suggestion is Aristotle's theory of catharsis, according which our negative emotional response to negatively expressive art results in a (positive) psychological purgation of the negative emotions (Aristotle 1987, 36–9 (ch. 6)). A less therapeutic approach is the suggestion that, since these emotions are without ‘life implications’ (that is, as discussed above, we are not sad about anything), we are able to take advantage of our responses to savor these emotions, gain an understanding of them, and be reassured that we have the capacity to feel them (Levinson 1982). A question that must be answered by any defender of this kind of response is the extent to which it explains, first, our persistence in seeking out music that elicits negative emotional experiences and, second, the enjoyment we seem to take in these negative responses, as opposed to putting up with them for their related benefits.

A different kind of solution to the problem argues that responses such as sadness that are evoked by expressive music are not really negative. Hume (1757) argues, with respect to tragedy, that the pleasure we take in the mode of presentation of the content of an artwork does not simply counterbalance the negative emotion evoked, but rather subsumes and transforms it into a pleasurable feeling. Kendall Walton argues (also with respect to tragedy) that sadness is not in itself negative. Rather, it is the situation to which sadness is the response that is negative. Thus, though we would not seek out the death of a loved one, given the death we ‘welcome’ the sorrow (Walton 1990, 255–9). Similarly, we cannot affect the sadness of a musical work by not listening to it, and so we welcome our sorrowful response to it as appropriate. Walton's approach has the advantage over Hume's of not positing a rather obscure psychological process. A difficulty for both, however, is the extent to which they accord with our emotional experience in rejecting the characterization of our sadness as negative.

Stephen Davies (1994, 316–20) argues that the kinds of solutions given above construe the problem too narrowly. Though he agrees that we accept the negative responses some music elicits because we are interested in understanding it, he points out that this gives rise to the further question of why we should be so interested in understanding something that brings us pain. His short answer is ‘We are just like that’ (1994, 317), and he begs off giving the long answer, since it seems to be the equivalent of giving an account of human nature, or the meaning of life. However, he points out that human life is suffused with activities that people willingly engage in despite, or indeed partially because of, the difficulties they bring about. Many things, from watching the news, through mountain-climbing, to raising children, are fraught with well-known difficulties, including negative emotional responses. Yet we enthusiastically engage in such activities because that is the kind of creature we are.

Finally, it must be noted that though we have spoken baldly of ‘emotions’ above, there is a consensus that we do not respond to music with fully-fledged emotions. Most obviously, such responses lack most of the behaviors characteristic of the supposedly felt emotion. Some take our responses instead to be weaker versions of ordinary emotions (Davies 1994, 299–307), others take them to share some aspects of ordinary emotions, such as their characteristic affective states, but to lack others, such as a specific intentional object (Levinson 1982, 319–22; Radford 1989). A third option is that we respond to expressive music with ‘quasi-emotions’, that is, the affective components of fully-fledged emotions that we imagine to be fully-fledged (Walton 1990, 240-55). Apart from debate over which of these proposals most closely matches our experience, there is the question of how well each of them fits with the various solutions discussed above to the problem of our negative responses to music, and with empirical work, in which there has been much recent interest (e.g. Robinson 2005; Bicknell 2007b, 2009; Cochrane 2010a, b; S. Davies 2011a, b).

4. Understanding Music

Animals can hear music in a sense – your dog might be frightened by the loud noise emitted by your stereo. But we do not hear music in this way; we can listen to it with understanding. What constitutes this experience of understanding music? To use an analogy, while the mere sound of a piece of music might be represented by a sonogram, our experience of it as music is better represented by something like a marked-up score. We hear individual notes that make up distinct melodies, harmonies, rhythms, sections, and so on, and the interaction between these elements. Such musical understanding comes in degrees along a number of dimensions. Your understanding of a given piece or style may be deeper than mine, while the reverse is true for another piece or style. I may hear more in a particular piece than you do, but my understanding of it may be inaccurate. My general musical understanding may be narrow, in the sense that I only understand one kind of music, while you understand many different kinds (Budd 1985b, 233–5; S. Davies 2011c, 88–95). Moreover, different pieces or kinds of pieces may call on different abilities, since some music has no harmony to speak of, some no melody, and so on. Many argue that, in addition to purely musical features, understanding the emotions expressed in a piece (of Western classical music, at least) is essential to adequately understanding it (e.g. Ridley 1993; S. Davies 1994; Levinson 1990e, 30; Scruton 1997; Robinson 2005, 348–78). (We have seen, in the previous section, the role this claim plays in some explanations of why we seek out music that elicits negative emotional responses.)

Though one must have recourse to technical terms, such as ‘melody’, ‘dominant seventh’, ‘sonata form’, and so on, in order to describe specific musical experiences, and the musical experience in general, it is widely agreed that one need not possess these concepts explicitly, nor the correlative vocabulary or in order to listen with understanding (Budd 1985b; 245–8; S. Davies 1994, 346–9; Levinson 1990e, 35–41; see DeBellis 1995 and Huovinen 2008 for dissenting views). However, it is also widely acknowledged that such explicit theoretical knowledge can aid deeper musical understanding, and is requisite for the description and understanding of one's own musical experience and that of others.

At the base of the musical experience seem to be (i) the experience of tones, as opposed to mere pitched sounds, where a tone is heard as being in ‘musical space’, that is, as bearing such relations to other tones as being higher or lower, or of the same kind (at the octave), and (ii) the experience of movement, as when we hear a melody as wandering far afield and then coming to rest where it began. Roger Scruton (1983; 1997, 1–96) argues that these experiences are irreducibly metaphorical, since they involve the application of spatial concepts to that which is not literally spatial. (There is no identifiable individual that moves from place to place in a melody (S. Davies 1994, 229–34).) Malcolm Budd (1985b) argues that to appeal to metaphor in this context is unilluminating since, first, it is unclear what it means for an experience to be metaphorical and, second, a metaphor is only given meaning through its interpretation, which Scruton not only fails to give, but argues is unavailable. Budd suggests that the metaphor is reducible, and thus eliminable, apparently in terms of purely musical (i.e., non-spatial) concepts or vocabulary. Stephen Davies (1994, 234–40) doubts that the spatial vocabulary can be eliminated, but he is sympathetic to Budd's rejection of the centrality of metaphor. Instead, he argues that our use of spatial and motion terms to describe music is a secondary, but literal, use of those terms that is widely used to describe temporal processes, such as the ups and downs of the stock market, the theoretical position one occupies, one's spirits plunging, and so on. The debate continues in Budd 2003, Scruton 2004, and S. Davies 2011d.

Davies is surely right about the ubiquity of the application of the language of space and motion to processes that lack individuals located in space. The appeal to secondary literal meanings, however, can seem as unsatisfying as the appeal to irreducible metaphor. We do not hear music simply as a temporal process, it might be objected, but as moving in the primary sense of the word, though we know that it does not literally so move. One way to develop a position out of this intuition would be to emphasize Scruton's appeal to imagination while dropping the appeal to metaphor. For instance, one might argue that our hearing the music as moving is a matter of imagining that it so moves. Davies might respond with his observation that we do not even hear in the music a reidentifiable individual that moves: ‘The theme contains movement but does not itself move; the notes of the theme do not move, although movement is heard between them’ (1994, 234). If this is so, the content of the proposed imagining might be too incoherent to form the core of a viable theory. But it is not obvious that we do not hear a melody, say, as containing reidentifiable individuals which move up and down. This would explain the naturalness with which we understand, for instance, some early Warner Bros. cartoons, where a single note on a staff jumps from one line to another, thus creating a melody.

Moving from basic musical understanding to the appreciation of complex works of instrumental music, Jerrold Levinson makes a case against what he sees as the paradigmatic conception of musical understanding as a matter of the apprehension of form (1997). As a replacement for this ‘architectonicism’, he promotes ‘concatenationism’: the view that basic musical understanding consists in following the musical and emotional qualities of passages of music, and transitions between them, that are short enough to be apprehended as a single experience (‘quasi-hearing’). He qualifies this basic idea considerably, allowing for the experience of previous parts of the piece, and anticipation of future parts, to modify one's experience of the music in the moment. He also allows that architectonic awareness may play a role in enhancing one's moment-to-moment experience, and may even play an ineliminable part in the understanding of some pieces. Nonetheless, Levinson maintains that the part played by architectonic knowledge in basic musical understanding is minimal, and that the cases where architectonic knowledge is necessary are very much the exception.

Peter Kivy has taken up the gauntlet on behalf of the architectonicists (2001; see also S. Davies 2011c, 95–9). While Kivy acknowledges that the kinds of experiences Levinson champions are necessary to basic musical understanding, he defends the idea that grasping the large-scale form of most pieces of Western classical music, at least, is necessary for an adequate understanding of them. He does not deny that the experience of the form of a piece in listening to it is more intellectual than quasi-hearing, but he rejects Levinson's argument that it is non-perceptual, and thus marginal to an adequate experience of it as music. Rather, Kivy argues, such experience is a matter of bring one's perceptions under sophisticated concepts. (A tactic Kivy does not consider is an attempt to hoist Levinson with his own contextualist petard, arguing that even if architectonic listening is non-perceptual it is a well-established mode of understanding pieces of music in the Western classical music world, and thus that to argue music must be understood primarily perceptually is to beg the question.)

Despite the heated debate Levinson's view has generated, it is not clear that there is so much disagreement between the architectonicist and the concatenationist. Both agree that the aspect of musical understanding the other emphasizes is a non-negligible component in the full understanding of a musical work. Levinson has been explicit since the first publication of his view that he intends it more as a polemic against, and corrective to architectonicism, rather than as a replacement for it (1997, ix-xi; 1999, 485; 2006b). Perhaps that purpose has now been fulfilled.

(For more detailed introductions to these and other topics in musical understanding, see S. Davies 2011c and Huovinen 2011.)

5. Music and Value

There are many disputes about the nature of aesthetic and artistic value, including even whether these are synonymous terms or distinct concepts. This is not the place to go into those disputes. With regard to the value of art in general, there are two central points on which there is some consensus. First, most philosophers take the value of artworks to be intrinsic to them, in the sense that the value of a work is tied essentially to the experience that the work affords. Thus, artworks are not (properly) valued merely instrumentally, as means to some end, but ‘for’ or ‘in’ themselves (Budd 1995, 1–16; S. Davies 1987, 198–200; Scruton 1997, 374–6; Levinson 1992, 15–17). The question that naturally arises next is what it is about the experience an artwork affords that makes it valuable. That pleasure is a non-negligible part of the answer to this question is the second point upon which there is some consensus (S. Davies 1987, 198–205; Levinson 1992; Kivy 1997b, 212–17). However, concomitant with this consensus is an acknowledgement that simple pleasure taken, say, in the pleasant sensuality of the musical sounds is too trivial to ground the great value we attribute to music. In looking for other sources, the puzzle that arises is that music is supposed to be an abstract art, par excellence. If this means that music is divorced from everything else that concerns us in the ‘real world’ (that is, extra-musical life), it is puzzling why we should find so valuable the experiences musical works afford. Like the questions about musical expressivity and understanding considered above, this puzzle is most evident with respect to ‘pure’ instrumental music, though solutions to it may be applicable to the purely musical elements of ‘impure’ musical works such as songs.

There are a couple of dimensions to most solutions of the puzzle of pure music's value. One is the extent to which it is agreed that music really is abstract. To the extent that one thinks that music is not unrelated to the real world, one will be able to argue that music's value is at least no more puzzling than the value of arts more obviously related to the real world, such as literature and representational painting and sculpture. The other dimension to most solutions of the puzzle of pure music's value is the extent to which one thinks the abstractness of music is the source of its value. Thus, two theorists might agree on the extent to which music is related to the real world (by being expressive, say), yet one locate its primary value in that expressivity while the other locates it in its abstract, purely musical features.

Unsurprisingly, perhaps, those who take the experience of music's expressiveness to be a more intimately emotional one (through being predicated on imaginative engagement with the music, say), tend to emphasize that experience as more central to musical understanding, and thus attribute a larger part of music's value to its expressivity. Those, on the other hand, whose theory of the experience of musical expressivity is more distanced (a matter of noticed resemblance, say), tend to place less weight on this element in their theories of musical value. At one extreme of this spectrum is the position that denies music to be expressive at all, and thus cannot attribute music's value to its expressivity (most notably Hanslick (1986); see also Zangwill 2004). Apart from this extreme position, most theorists agree that music's value is to be located in different kinds of experience, including the experience of purely musical features and expressive features; their disagreements are mostly about the relative weight of these different kinds of experiences in a complete account of musical value.

As with the debate between architectonicists and concatenationists, discussed above, the extent of the disagreement between various parties to this dispute is not clear. Those defending the value of music's expressivity tend to claim that its contribution to overall musical value is significant, but they stop short even of according it primary value, and do not argue against the value of purely musical elements of musical works (Ridley 1995, 192–6; Levinson 1982; 1992, 20–2; 1996b 124–5). They content themselves rather with pointing out the ways in which expressivity can be valuable. These include many of the features discussed above with respect to our interest in listening to music that arouses negative affective states in the listener. To recap, our emotional responses to music's expressivity can enable us to savor, understand, and even, to some extent, experience emotions in a ‘safe’ way. They can provide us with a cathartic release, and enable us to participate in a kind of communication with the composer or communion with other members of our musical culture (Levinson 1982; 1996b; Higgins 1991; S. Davies 1994, 271). Emphasizing this last point, Roger Scruton argues that music's value is quasi-moral, in that the kinds of music one responds to, or those valued in a particular culture, reflect the state of that individual's or culture's ‘soul’ (1997, 380–91; see also S. Davies 1994, 275–6.) Stephen Davies (1987, 207–12) has argued that there are beneficial consequences of an interest in music in general, such as heightened emotional and aural sensitivity, which are not properly valued as consequences of listening to individual pieces, but which lead us to value musical culture as a whole (just as we value kindness for its consequences in general, while rejecting instrumental motivations for kind acts) as inappropriate.

On the other hand, those who defend the value of purely musical features tend to argue that the value of those features is primary, and that the value of music's expressivity is overrated. Alan Goldman (1992), for instance, argues against the idea that music is particularly suited to the expression of emotion, claiming that representational arts such as painting and literature are better at this. Moreover, he disputes the grounds of the value of expressivity given above. For example, he denies that music can teach us much about the emotions, and that we can savor our negative emotional responses to expressive music. Similarly, after an extensive discussion of the nature of musical expressiveness, Malcolm Budd argues that such expressiveness cannot come close to explaining music's value (1995, 155–7). He points to the facts that much valuable music is not expressive and that the equal expressiveness of different pieces would be outweighed in a comparative evaluation by the differences between them in terms of their purely musical value.

Both Budd and Goldman locate the value of pure music precisely in the abstractness that to some seems the greatest obstacle to explaining that value. Budd (1995, 164–71) points out that we have an extensive interest in abstract forms outside the realm of music, such as those of natural formations and in the decorative arts, and that such forms are capable of possessing valued aesthetic properties, such as beauty, elegance, and so on. Thus, it is no surprise that we value highly the works of an art of abstract forms. Such artworks can exhibit such forms at a level of complexity not found in nature or the decorative arts and, further, can be about their abstract patterns, as when the first movement of a piano sonata ‘says something about’ sonata form. Though these claims may be true, and make the case of music less puzzling by showing it shares the grounds of its value with other things, they also leave the primary puzzle largely unsolved, namely, why it is that we find the experience of abstract forms so valuable. (In Budd's defense, this puzzle is no longer one specific to the philosophy of music.)

Goldman (1992), by contrast, emphasizes the detachment from the world of practical affairs implied by music's abstractness. The complexity of great musical works demands the active engagement of our cognitive faculties, which we find rewarding, yet not in the pursuit of some practical goal which could be frustrated. However, there are some links between music and the ‘real world’ in his account of the value of the musical experience. For one, we value pieces that lead to a satisfying resolution, particularly if they are colored with negative affect, since this experience is rare in everyday life. For another, we feel a particularly close communion with the minds of the composer and other listeners, since we feel we are going through an experience just like one they have also had.

Peter Kivy offers a similar, if less detailed, defense of this ‘liberating’ power of music (1997b, 179–217). One problem for Kivy's account is that he maintains both that our experience of music has ‘complete freedom from connection with our workaday world’ (1997b, 209), and that the properties of the music relevant to our experience include, ‘most importantly, its expressive properties’ (1997b, 205, original emphasis). Without some account of how our interest in the expressive properties of a piece does not lead us back to the workaday world (as Kivy insists such properties do in representational arts, such as literature and painting) it seems we should prefer a theory, such as Budd's or Goldman's, that provides some account of the real-world role our experience of these properties plays.

(For introductions to the evaluation of musical works and performances, see S. Davies 1987, Levinson 1990f, and Gracyk 2011.)

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aesthetics: aesthetic judgment | art, definition of | dependence, ontological | emotion | fiction | Ingarden, Roman | ontology of art, history of | properties | types and tokens | value: intrinsic vs. extrinsic