Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy
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Singularities and Black Holes

First published Mon Jun 29, 2009

A spacetime singularity is a breakdown in the geometrical structure of space and time. It is a topic of ongoing physical and philosophical research to clarify both the nature and significance of such pathologies. Because it is the fundamental geometry that is breaking down, spacetime singularities are often viewed as an end, or “edge,” of spacetime itself. However, numerous difficulties arise when one tries to make this notion more precise.

Our current theory of spacetime, general relativity, not only allows for singularities, but tells us that they are unavoidable in some real-life circumstances. Thus we apparently need to understand the ontology of singularities if we are to grasp the nature of space and time in the actual universe. The possibility of singularities also carries potentially important implications for the issues of physical determinism and the scope of physical laws.

Black holes are regions of spacetime from which nothing, not even light, can escape. A typical black hole is the result of the gravitational force becoming so strong that one would have to travel faster than light to escape its pull. Such black holes contain a spacetime singularity at their center; thus we cannot fully understand a black hole without also understanding the nature of singularities. However, black holes raise several additional conceptual issues. As purely gravitational entities, black holes are at the heart of many attempts to formulate a theory of quantum gravity. Although they are regions of spacetime, black holes are also thermodynamical entities, with a temperature and an entropy; however, it is far from clear what statistical physics underlies these thermodynamical facts. The evolution of black holes is also apparently in conflict with standard quantum evolution, for such evolution rules out the sort of increase in entropy that seems to be required when black holes are present. This has led to a debate over what fundamental physical principles are likely to be preserved in, or violated by, a full quantum theory of gravity.

1. Spacetime Singularities

General relativity, Einstein's theory of space, time, and gravity, allows for the existence of singularities. On this nearly all agree. However, when it comes to the question of how, precisely, singularities are to be defined, there is widespread disagreement Singularties in some way signal a breakdown of the geometry itself, but this presents an obvious difficulty in referring to a singulary as a “thing” that resides at some location in spacetime: without a well-behaved geomtry, there can be no “location.” For this reason, some philosopers and physicists have suggested that we should not speak of “singularities” at all, but rather of “singular spacetimes.” In this entry, we shall generally treat these two formulations as being equivalent, but we will highlight the distinction when it becomes significant.

Singularities are often conceived of metaphorically as akin to a tear in the fabric of spacetime. The most common attempts to define singularities center on one of two core ideas that this image readily suggests.

tear in spacetime

The first is that a spacetime has a singularity just in case it contains an incomplete path, one that cannot be continued indefinitely, but draws up short, as it were, with no possibility of extension. (“Where is the path supposed to go after it runs into the tear? Where did it come from when it emerged from the tear?”). The second is that a spacetime is singular just in case there are points “missing from it.” (“Where are the spacetime points that used to be or should be where the tear is?”) Another common thought, often adverted to in discussion of the two primary notions, is that singular structure, whether in the form of missing points or incomplete paths, must be related to pathological behavior of some sort on the part of the singular spacetime's curvature, that is, the fundamental deformation of spacetime that manifests itself as “the gravitational field.” For example, some measure of the intensity of the curvature (“the strength of the gravitational field”) may increase without bound as one traverses the incomplete path. Each of these three ideas will be considered in turn below.

There is likewise considerable disagreement over the significance of singularties. Many eminent physicists believe that general relativity's prediction of singular structure signals a serious deficiency in the theory; singularities are an indication that the description offered by general relativity is breaking down. Others believe that singularities represent an exciting new horizon for physicists to aim for and explore in cosmology, holding out the promise of physical phenomena differing so radically from any that we have yet experienced as to ensure, in our attempt to observe, quantify and understand them, a profound advance in our comprehension of the physical world.

1.1 Path Incompleteness

While there are competing definitions of spacetime singularities, the most central, and widely accepted, criterion rests on the possibility that some spacetimes contain incomplete paths. Indeed, the rival definitions (in terms of missing points or curvature pathology) still make use of the notion of path incompleteness.

(The reader unfamiliar with general relativity may find it helpful to review the Hole Argument entry's Beginner's Guide to Modern Spacetime Theories, which presents a brief and accessible introduction to the concepts of a spacetime manifold, a metric, and a worldline.)

A path in spacetime is a continuous chain of events through space and time. If I snap my fingers continually, without pause, then the collection of snaps forms a path. The paths used in the most important singularity theorems represent possible trajectories of particles and observers. Such paths are known as “world-lines”; they consist of the events occupied by an object throughout its lifetime. That the paths be incomplete and inextendible means, roughly speaking, that, after a finite amount of time, a particle or observer following that path would “run out of world,” as it were—it would hurtle into the tear in the fabric of spacetime and vanish. Alternatively, a particle or observer could leap out of the tear to follow such a path. While there is no logical or physical contradiction in any of this, it appears on the face of it physically suspect for an observer or a particle to be allowed to pop in or out of existence right in the middle of spacetime, so to speak—if that does not suffice for concluding that the spacetime is “singular,” it is difficult to imagine what else would. At the same time, the ground-breaking work predicting the existence of such pathological paths produced no consensus on what ought to count as a necessary condition for singular structure according to this criterion, and thus no consensus on a fixed definition for it.

In this context, an incomplete path in spacetime is one that is both inextendible and of finite proper length, which means that any particle or observer traversing the path would experience only a finite interval of existence that in principle cannot be continued any longer. However, for this criterion to do the work we want it to, we'll need to limit the class of spacetimes under discussion. Specifically, we shall be concerned with spacetimes that are maximally extended (or just maximal). In effect, this condition says that one's representation of spacetime is “as big as it possibly can be”—there is, from the mathematical point of view, no way to treat the spacetime as being a proper subset of a larger, more extensive spacetime.

non-maximal spacetime

If there is an incomplete path in a spacetime, goes the thinking behind the requirement, then perhaps the path is incomplete only because one has not made one's model of spacetime big enough. If one were to extend the spacetime manifold maximally, then perhaps the previously incomplete path could be extended into the new portions of the larger spacetime, indicating that no physical pathology underlay the incompleteness of the path. The inadequacy would merely reside in the incomplete physical model we had been using to represent spacetime.

An example of a non-maximally extended spacetime can be easily had, along with a sense of why they intuitively seem in some way or other deficient. For the moment, imagine spacetime is only two-dimensional, and flat. Now, excise from somewhere on the plane a closed set shaped like Ingrid Bergman. Any path that had passed through one of the points in the removed set is now incomplete.

non-maximal spacetime made maximal by filling its holes

In this case, the maximal extension of the resulting spacetime is obvious, and does indeed fix the problem of all such incomplete paths: re-incorporate the previously excised set. The seemingly artificial and contrived nature of such examples, along with the ease of rectifying them, seems to militate in favor of requiring spacetimes to be maximal.

Once we've established that we're interested in maximal spacetimes, the next issue is what sort of path incompleteness is relevant for singularities. Here we find a good deal of controversy. Criteria of incompleteness typically look at how some parameter naturally associated with the path (such as its proper length) grows. One generally also places further restrictions on the paths that are worth considering (for example, one rules out paths that could only be taken by particles undergoing unbounded acceleration in a finite period of time). A spacetime is said to be singular if it possesses a path such that the specified parameter associated with that path cannot increase without bound as one traverses the entirety of the maximally extended path. The idea is that the parameter at issue will serve as a marker for something like the time experienced by a particle or observer, and so, if the value of that parameter remains finite along the whole path then we've run out of path in a finite amout of time, as it were. We've hit and “edge” or a “tear” in spacetime.

For a path that is everywhere timelike (i.e., that does not involves speeds at or above that of light), it is natural to take as the parameter the proper time a particle or observer would experience along the path, that is, the time measured along the path by a natural clock, such as one based on the natural vibrational frequency of an atom. (There are also fairly natural choices that one can make for spacelike paths (i.e., those that consist of points at a single “time”) and null paths (those followed by light signals). However, because the spacelike and null cases add yet another level of difficulty, we shall not discuss them here.) The physical interpretation of this sort of incompleteness for timelike paths is more or less straightforward: a timelike path incomplete with respect to proper time in the future direction would represent the possible trajectory of a massive body that would, say, never age beyond a certain point in its existence (an analogous statement can be made, mutatis mutandis, if the path were incomplete in the past direction).

We cannot, however, simply stipulate that a maximal spacetime is singular just in case it contains paths of finite proper length that cannot be extended. Such a criterion would imply that even the flat spacetime described by special relativity is singular, which is surely unacceptable. This would follow because, even in flat spacetime, there are timelike paths with unbounded acceleration which have only a finite proper length (proper time, in this case) and are also inextendible.

The most obvious option is to define a spacetime as singular if and only if it contains incomplete, inextendible timelike geodesics, i.e., paths representing the trajectories of inertial observers, those in free-fall experiencing no acceleration “other than that due to gravity.” However, this criterion seems too permissive, in that it would count as non-singular some spacetimes whose geometry seems quite pathological. For example, Geroch (1968) demonstrates that a spacetime can be geodesically complete and yet possess an incomplete timelike path of bounded total acceleration—that is to say, an inextendible path in spacetime traversable by a rocket with a finite amount of fuel, along which an observer could experience only a finite amount of proper time. Surely the intrepid astronaut in such a rocket, who would never age beyond a certain point but who also would never necessarily die or cease to exist, would have just cause to complain that something was singular about this spacetime.

We therefore want a definition that is not restricted to geodesics when deciding whether a spacetime is singular. However, we need some way of overcoming the fact that non-singular spacetimes include inextendible paths of finite proper length. The most widely accepted solution to this problem makes use of a slightly different (and slightly technical) notion of length, known as “generalized affine length.”[1] Unlike proper length, this generalized affine length depends on some arbitrary choices (roughly speaking, the length will vary depending on the coordinates one chooses). However, if the length is infinite for one such choice, it will be infinite for all other choices. Thus the question of whether a path has a finite or infinite generalized affine length is a perfectly well-defined question, and that is all we'll need.

The definition that has won the most widespread acceptance — leading Earman (1995, p. 36) to dub this the semiofficial definition of singularities — is the following:

A maximal spacetime is singular if and only if it contains an inextendible path of finite generalized affine length.

To say that a spacetime is singular then is to say that there is at least one maximally extended path that has a bounded (generalized affine) length. To put it another way, a spacetime is nonsingular when it is complete in the sense that the only reason any given path might not be extendible is that it's already infinitely long (in this technical sense).

The chief problem facing this definition of singularities is that the physical significance of generalized affine length is opaque, and thus it is unclear what the relevance of singularities, defined in this way, might be. It does nothing, for example, to clarify the physical status of the spacetime described by Geroch; it seems as though the new criterion does nothing more than sweep the troubling aspects of such examples under the rug. It does not explain why we ought not take such prima facie puzzling and troubling examples as physically pathological; it merely declares by fiat that they are not.

So where does this leave us? The consensus seems to be that, while it is easy in specific examples to conclude that incomplete paths of various sorts represent singular structure, no entirely satisfactory, strict definition of singular structure in their terms has yet been formulated. For a philosopher, the issues offer deep and rich veins for those contemplating, among other matters, the role of explanatory power in the determination of the adequacy of physical theories, the role of metaphysics and intuition, questions about the nature of the existence attributable to physical entities in spacetime and to spacetime itself, and the status of mathematical models of physical systems in the determination of our understanding of those systems as opposed to in the mere representation our knowledge of them.

1.2 Boundary Constructions

We have seen that one runs into difficulties if one tries to define singularities as “things” that have “locations,” and how some of those difficulties can be avoided by defining singular spacetimes in terms of incomplete paths. However, it would be desirable for many reasons to have a characterization of a spacetime singularity in general relativity as, in some sense or other, a spatiotemporal “place.” If one had a precise characterization of a singularity in terms of points that are missing from spacetime, one might then be able to analyze the structure of the spacetime “locally at the singularity,” instead of taking troublesome, perhaps ill-defined limits along incomplete paths. Many discussions of singular structure in relativistic spacetimes, therefore, are premised on the idea that a singularity represents a point or set of points that in some sense or other is “missing” from the spacetime manifold, that spacetime has a “hole” or “tear” in it that we could fill in or patch by the appendage of a boundary to it.

In trying to determine whether an ordinary web of cloth has a hole in it, for example, one would naturally rely on the fact that the web exists in space and time. In this case one can, so to speak, point to a hole in the cloth by specifying points of space at a particular moment of time not currently occupied by any of the cloth but which would, as it were, complete the cloth were they so occupied. When trying to conceive of a singular spacetime, however, one does not have the luxury of imagining it embedded in a larger space with respect to which one can say there are points missing from it. In any event, the demand that the spacetime be maximal rules out the possibility of embedding the spacetime manifold in any larger spacetime manifold of any ordinary sort. It would seem, then, that making precise the idea that a singularity is a marker of missing points ought to devolve upon some idea of intrinsic structural incompleteness in the spacetime manifold rather than extrinsic incompleteness with respect to an external structure.

Force of analogy suggests that one define a spacetime to have points missing from it if and only if it contains incomplete, inextendible paths, and then try to use these incomplete paths to construct in some fashion or other new, properly situated points for the spacetime, the addition of which will make the previously inextendible paths extendible. These constructed points would then be our candidate singularities. Missing points on this view would correspond to a boundary for a singular spacetime—actual points of an extended spacetime at which paths incomplete in the original spacetime would terminate. (We will, therefore, alternate between speaking of missing points and speaking of boundary points, with no difference of sense intended.) The goal then is to construct this extended space using the incomplete paths as one's guide.

Now, in trivial examples of spacetimes with missing points such as the one offered before, flat spacetime with a closed set in the shape of Ingrid Bergman excised from it, one does not need any technical machinery to add the missing points back in. One can do it by hand, as it were. Many spacetimes with incomplete paths, however, do not allow “missing points” to be attached in any obvious way by hand, as this example does. For this program to be viable, which is to say, in order to give substance to the idea that there really are points that in some sense ought to have been included in the spacetime in the first place, we require a physically natural completion procedure based on the incomplete paths that can be applied to incomplete paths in arbitrary spacetimes.

Several problems with this program make themselves felt immediately. Consider, for example, an instance of spacetime representing the final state of the complete gravitational collapse of a spherically symmetric body resulting in a black hole. (See §3 below for a description of black holes.) In this spacetime, any timelike path entering the black hole will necessarily be extendible for only a finite amount of proper time—it then “runs into the singularity” at the center of the black hole. In its usual presentation, however, there are no obvious points missing from the spacetime at all. It is, to all appearances, as complete as the Cartesian plane, excepting only for the existence of incomplete curves, no class of which indicates by itself a place in the manifold to add a point to it to make the paths in the class complete. Likewise, in our own spacetime every inextendible, past-directed timelike path is incomplete (and our spacetime is singular): they all “run into the Big Bang.” Insofar as there is no moment of time at which the Big Bang occurred (there is no moment of time at which time began, so to speak), there is no point to serve as the past endpoint of such a path.

The reaction to the problems faced by these boundary constructions is varied, to say the least, ranging from blithe acceptance of the pathology (Clarke 1993), to the attitude that there is no satisfying boundary construction currently available without ruling out the possibility of better ones in the future (Wald 1984), to not even mentioning the possibility of boundary constructions when discussing singular structure (Joshi 1993), to rejection of the need for such constructions at all (Geroch, Can-bin and Wald, 1982).

Nonetheless, many eminent physicists seem convinced that general relativity stands in need of such a construction, and have exerted extraordinary efforts in the service of trying to devise such constructions. This fact raises several fascinating philosophical problems. Though physicists offer as strong motivation the possibility of gaining the ability to analyze singular phenomena locally in a mathematically well-defined manner, they more often speak in terms that strongly suggest they suffer a metaphysical, even an ontological, itch that can be scratched only by the sharp point of a localizable, spatiotemporal entity serving as the locus of their theorizing. However, even were such a construction forthcoming, what sort of physical and theoretical status could accrue to these missing points? They would not be idealizations of a physical system in any ordinary sense of the term, insofar as they would not represent a simplified model of a system formed by ignoring various of its physical features, as, for example, one may idealize the modeling of a fluid by ignoring its viscosity. Neither would they seem necessarily to be only convenient mathematical fictions, as, for example, are the physically impossible dynamical evolutions of a system one integrates over in the variational derivation of the Euler-Lagrange equations, for, as we have remarked, many physicists and philosophers seem eager to find such a construction for the purpose of bestowing substantive and clear ontic status on singular structure. What sorts of theoretical entities, then, could they be, and how could they serve in physical theory?

While the point of this project may seem at bottom identical to the path incompleteness account discussed in §1.1, insofar as singular structure will be defined by the presence of incomplete, inextendible paths, there is a crucial semantic and logical difference between the two. Here, the existence of the incomplete path is not taken itself to constitute the singular structure, but rather serves only as a marker for the presence of singular structure in the sense of missing points: the incomplete path is incomplete because it “runs into a hole” in the spacetime that, were it filled, would allow the path to be continued; this hole is the singular structure, and the points constructed to fill it compose its locus.

Currently, however, there seems to be even less consensus on how (and whether) one should define singular structure in terms of missing points than there is regarding definitions in terms of path incompleteness. Moreover, this project also faces even more technical and philosophical problems. For these reasons, path incompleteness is generally considered the default definition of singularities.

1.3 Curvature Pathology

While path incompleteness seems to capture an important aspect of the intuitive picture of singular structure, it completely ignores another seemingly integral aspect of it: curvature pathology. If there are incomplete paths in a spacetime, it seems that there should be a reason that the path cannot go farther. The most obvious candidate explanation of this sort is something going wrong with the dynamical structure of the spacetime, which is to say, with the curvature of the spacetime. This suggestion is bolstered by the fact that local measures of curvature do in fact blow up as one approaches the singularity of a standard black hole or the big bang singularity. However, there is one problem with this line of thought: no species of curvature pathology we know how to define is either necessary or sufficient for the existence of incomplete paths. (For a discussion of defining singularities in terms of curvature pathologies, see Curiel 1998.)

To make the notion of curvature pathology more precise, we will use the manifestly physical idea of tidal force. Tidal force is generated by the differential in intensity of the gravitational field, so to speak, at neighboring points of spacetime. For example, when you stand, your head is farther from the center of the Earth than your feet, so it feels a (practically negligible) smaller pull downward than your feet. (For a diagram illustrating the nature of tidal forces, see Figure 9 of the entry on Inertial Frames.) Tidal forces are a physical manifestation of spacetime curvature, and one gets direct observational access to curvature by measuring these forces. For our purposes, it is important that in regions of extreme curvature, tidal forces can grow without bound.

It is perhaps surprising that the state of motion of the observer as it traverses an incomplete path (e.g. whether the observer is accelerating or spinning) can be decisive in determining the physical response of an object to the curvature pathology. Whether the object is spinning on its axis or not, for example, or accelerating slightly in the direction of motion, may determine whether the object gets crushed to zero volume along such a path or whether it survives (roughly) intact all the way along it, as in examples offered by Ellis and Schmidt (1977). The effect of the observer's state of motion on his or her experience of tidal forces can be even more pronounced than this. There are examples of spacetimes in which an observer cruising along a certain kind of path would experience unbounded tidal forces and so be torn apart, while another observer, in a certain technical sense approaching the same limiting point as the first observer, accelerating and decelerating in just the proper way, would experience a perfectly well-behaved tidal force, though she would approach as near as one likes to the other fellow who is in the midst of being ripped to shreds.[2]

Things can get stranger still. There are examples of incomplete geodesics contained entirely within a well-defined area of a spacetime, each having as its limiting point an honest-to-goodness point of spacetime, such that an observer freely falling along such a path would be torn apart by unbounded tidal forces; it can easily be arranged in such cases, however, that a separate observer, who actually travels through the limiting point, will experience perfectly well-behaved tidal forces.[3] Here we have an example of an observer being ripped apart by unbounded tidal forces right in the middle of spacetime, as it were, while other observers cruising peacefully by could reach out to touch him or her in solace during the final throes of agony. This example also provides a nice illustration of the inevitable difficulties attendant on attempts to localize singular structure.

It would seem, then, that curvature pathology as standardly quantified is not in any physical sense a well-defined property of a region of spacetime simpliciter. When we consider the curvature of four-dimensional spacetime, the motion of the device that we use to probe a region (as well as the nature of the device) becomes crucially important for the question of whether pathological behavior manifests itself. This fact raises questions about the nature of quantitative measures of properties of entities in general relativity, and what ought to count as observable, in the sense of reflecting the underlying physical structure of spacetime. Because apparently pathological phenomena may occur or not depending on the types of measurements one is performing, it does not seem that this pathology reflects anything about the state of spacetime itself, or at least not in any localizable way. What then may it reflect, if anything? Much work remains to be done by both physicists and by philosophers in this area, the determination of the nature of physical quantities in general relativity and what ought to count as an observable with intrinsic physical significance. See Bergmann (1977), Bergmann and Komar (1962), Bertotti (1962), Coleman and Korté (1992), and Rovelli (1991, 2001, 2002a, 2002b) for discussion of many different topics in this area, approached from several different perspectives.

2. The Significance of Singularities

When considering the implications of spacetime singularities, it is important to note that we have good reasons to believe that the spacetime of our universe is singular. In the late 1960s, Hawking, Penrose, and Geroch proved several singularity theorems, using the path-incompleteness definition of singularities (see, e.g., Hawking and Ellis 1973). These theorems showed that if certain reasonable premises were satisfied, then in certain circumstances singularities could not be avoided. Notable among these conditions was the “positive energy condition” that captures the idea that energy is never negative. These theorems indicate that our universe began with an initial singularity, the “Big Bang,” 13.7 billion years ago. They also indicate that in certain circumstances (discussed below) collapsing matter will form a black hole with a central singularity.

Should these results lead us to believe that singularities are real? Many physicists and philosophers resist this conclusion. Some argue that singularities are too repugnant to be real. Others argue that the singular behavior at the center of black holes and at the beginning of time points to a the limit of the domain of applicability of general relativity. However, some are inclined to take general relativity at its word, and simply accept its prediction of singularities as a surprising, but perfectly consistent account of the geometry of our world.

2.1 Definitions and Existence of Singularities

As we have seen, there is no commonly accepted, strict definition of singularity, no physically reasonable definition of missing point, and no necessary connection of singular structure, at least as characterized by the presence of incomplete paths, to the presence of curvature pathology. What conclusions should be drawn from this state of affairs? There seem to be two primary responses, that of Clarke (1993) and Earman (1995) on the one hand, and that of Geroch, Can-bin and Wald (1982), and Curiel (1998) on the other. The former holds that the mettle of physics and philosophy demands that we find a precise, rigorous and univocal definition of singularity. On this view, the host of philosophical and physical questions surrounding general relativity's prediction of singular structure would best be addressed with such a definition in hand, so as better to frame and answer these questions with precision in its terms, and thus perhaps find other, even better questions to pose and attempt to answer. The latter view is perhaps best summarized by a remark of Geroch, Can-bin and Wald (1982): “The purpose of a construction [of ‘singular points’], after all, is merely to clarify the discussion of various physical issues involving singular space-times: general relativity as it stands is fully viable with no precise notion of ‘singular points’.” On this view, the specific physics under investigation in any particular situation should dictate which definition of singularity to use in that situation, if, indeed, any at all.

In sum, the question becomes the following: Is there a need for a single, blanket definition of singularity or does the urge for one bespeak only an old Platonic, essentialist prejudice? This question has obvious connections to the broader question of natural kinds in science. One sees debates similar to those canvassed above when one tries to find, for example, a strict definition of biological species. Clearly part of the motivation for searching for a single exceptionless definition is the impression that there is some real feature of the world (or at least of our spacetime models) which we can hope to capture precisely. Further, we might hope that our attempts to find a rigorous and exceptionless definition will help us to better understand the feature itself. Nonetheless, it is not entirely clear why we shouldn't be happy with a variety of types of singular structure, and with the permissive attitude that none should be considered the “right” definition of singularities.

Even without an accepted, strict definition of singularity for relativistic spacetimes, the question can be posed of what it may mean to ascribe “existence” to singular structure under any of the available open possibilities. It is not farfetched to think that answers to this question may bear on the larger question of the existence of spacetime points in general.

It would be difficult to argue that an incomplete path in a maximal relativistic spacetime does not exist in at least some sense of the term. It is not hard to convince oneself, however, that the incompleteness of the path does not exist at any particular point of the spacetime in the same way, say, as this glass of beer at this moment exists at this point of spacetime. If there were a point on the manifold where the incompleteness of the path could be localized, surely that would be the point at which the incomplete path terminated. But if there were such a point, then the path could be extended by having it pass through that point. It is perhaps this fact that lies behind much of the urgency surrounding the attempt to define singular structure as “missing points.”

The demand that singular structure be localized at a particular place bespeaks an old Aristotelian substantivalism that invokes the maxim, “To exist is to exist in space and time” (Earman 1995, p. 28). Aristotelian substantivalism here refers to the idea contained in Aristotle's contention that everything that exists is a substance and that all substances can be qualified by the Aristotelian categories, two of which are location in time and location in space. One need not consider anything so outré as incomplete, inextendible paths, though, in order to produce examples of entities that seem undeniably to exist in some sense of the term or other, and yet which cannot have any even vaguely determined location in time and space predicated of them. Indeed, several essential features of a relativistic spacetime, singular or not, cannot be localized in the way that an Aristotelian substantivalist would demand. For example, the Euclidean (or non-Euclidean ) nature of a space is not something with a precise location. Likewise, various spacetime geometrical structures (such as the metric, the affine structure, etc.) cannot be localized in the way that the Aristotelian would demand. The existential status of such entities vis-à-vis more traditionally considered objects is an open and largely ignored issue. Because of the way the issue of singular structure in relativistic spacetimes ramifies into almost every major open question in relativistic physics today, both physical and philosophical, it provides a peculiarly rich and attractive focus for these sorts of questions.

2.2 The Breakdown of General Relativity?

At the heart of all of our conceptions of a spacetime singularity is the notion of some sort of failing: a path that disappears, points that are torn out, spacetime curvature that becomes pathological. However, perhaps the failing lies not in the spacetime of the actual world (or of any physically possible world), but rather in the theoretical description of the spacetime. That is, perhaps we shouldn't think that general relativity is accurately describing the world when it posits singular structure.

Indeed, in most scientific arenas, singular behavior is viewed as an indication that the theory being used is deficient. It is therefore common to claim that general relativity, in predicting that spacetime is singular, is predicting its own demise, and that classical descriptions of space and time break down at black hole singularities and at the Big Bang. Such a view seems to deny that singularities are real features of the actual world, and to assert that they are instead merely artifices of our current (flawed) physical theories. A more fundamental theory — presumably a full theory of quantum gravity — will be free of such singular behavior. For example, Ashtekar and Bojowald (2006) and Ashtekar, Pawlowski and Singh (2006) argue that, in the context of loop quantum gravity, neither the big bang singularity nor black hole singularities appear.

On this reading, many of the earlier worries about the status of singularities become moot. Singularties don't exist, nor is the question of how to define them, as such, particularly urgent. Instead, the pressing question is what indicates the borders of the domain of applicability of general relativity? We pick up this question below in Section 5 on quantum black holes, for it is in this context that many of the explicit debates play out over the limits of general relativity.

3. Black Holes

The simplest picture of a black hole is that of a body whose gravity is so strong that nothing, not even light, can escape from it. Bodies of this type are already possible in the familiar Newtonian theory of gravity. The “escape velocity” of a body is the velocity at which an object would have to travel to escape the gravitational pull of the body and continue flying out to infinity. Because the escape velocity is measured from the surface of an object, it becomes higher if a body contracts down and becomes more dense. (Under such contraction, the mass of the body remains the same, but its surface gets closer to its center of mass; thus the gravitational force at the surface increases.) If the object were to become sufficiently dense, the escape velocity could therefore exceed the speed of light, and light itself would be unable to escape.

This much of the argument makes no appeal to relativistic physics, and the possibility of such classical black holes was noted in the late 18th Century by Michel (1784) and Laplace (1796). These Newtonian black holes do not precipitate quite the same sense of crisis as do relativistic black holes. While light hurled ballistically from the surface of the collapsed body cannot escape, a rocket with powerful motors firing could still gently pull itself free.

Taking relativistic considerations into account, however, we find that black holes are far more exotic entities. Given the usual understanding that relativity theory rules out any physical process going faster than light, we conclude that not only is light unable to escape from such a body: nothing would be able to escape this gravitational force. That includes the powerful rocket that could escape a Newtonian black hole. Further, once the body has collapsed down to the point where its escape velocity is the speed of light, no physical force whatsoever could prevent the body from continuing to collapse down further – for this would be equivalent to accelerating something to speeds beyond that of light. Thus once this critical amount of collapse is reached, the body will get smaller and smaller, more and more dense, without limit. It has formed a relativistic black hole; at its center lies a spacetime singularity.

For any given body, this critical stage of unavoidable collapse occurs when the object has collapsed to within its so-called Schwarzschild radius, which is proportional to the mass of the body. Our sun has a Schwarzschild radius of approximately three kilometers; the Earth's Schwarzschild radius is a little less than a centimeter. This means that if you could collapse all the Earth's matter down to a sphere the size of a pea, it would form a black hole. It is worth noting, however, that one does not need an extremely high density of matter to form a black hole if one has enough mass. Thus for example, if one has a couple hundred million solar masses of water at its standard density, it will be contained within its Schwarzschild radius and will form a black hole. Some supermassive black holes at the centers of galaxies are thought to be even more massive than this, at several billion solar masses.

The “event horizon” of a black hole is the point of no return. That is, it comprises the last events in the spacetime around the singularity at which a light signal can still escape to the external universe. For a standard (uncharged, non-rotating) black hole, the event horizon lies at the Schwarzschild radius. A flash of light that originates at an event inside the black hole will not be able to escape, but will instead end up in the central singularity of the black hole. A light flash originating at an event outside of the event horizon will escape, but it will be red-shifted strongly to the extent that it is near the horizon. An outgoing beam of light that originates at an event on the event horizon itself, by definition, remains on the event horizon until the temporal end of the universe.

General relativity tells us that clocks running at different locations in a gravitational field will generally not agree with one another. In the case of a black hole, this manifests itself in the following way. Imagine someone falls into a black hole, and, while falling, she flashes a light signal to us every time her watch hand ticks. Observing from a safe distance outside the black hole, we would find the times between the arrival of successive light signals to grow larger without limit. That is, it would appear to us that time were slowing down for the falling person as she approached the event horizon. The ticking of her watch (and every other process as well) would seem to go slower and slower as she got closer and closer to the event horizon. We would never actually see the light signals she emits when she crosses the event horizon; instead, she would seem to be eternally “frozen” just above the horizon. (This talk of “seeing” the person is somewhat misleading, because the light coming from the person would rapidly become severely red-shifted, and soon would not be practically detectable.)

From the perspective of the infalling person, however, nothing unusual happens at the event horizon. She would experience no slowing of clocks, nor see any evidence that she is passing through the event horizon of a black hole. Her passing the event horizon is simply the last moment in her history at which a light signal she emits would be able to escape from the black hole. The concept of an event horizon is a global concept that depends on how the events on the event horizon relate to the overall structure of the spacetime. Locally there is nothing noteworthy about the events at the event horizon. If the black hole is fairly small, then the tidal gravitational forces there would be quite strong. This just means that gravitational pull on one's feet, closer to the singularity, would be much stronger than the gravitational pull on one's head. That difference of force would be great enough to pull one apart. For a sufficiently large black hole the difference in gravitation at one's feet and head would be small enough for these tidal forces to be negligible.

As in the case of singularties, alternative definitions of black holes have been explored. These definitions typically focus on the one-way nature of the event horizon: things can go in, but nothing can get out. Such accounts have not won widespread support, however, and we have not space here to elaborate on them further.[4]

3.1 The Geometrical Nature of Black Holes

One of the most remarkable features of relativistic black holes is that they are purely gravitational entities. A pure black hole spacetime contains no matter whatsoever. It is a “vacuum” solution to the Einstein field equations, which just means that it is a solution of Einstein's gravitational field equations in which the matter density is everywhere zero. (Of course, one can also consider a black hole with matter present.) In pre-relativistic physics we think of gravity as a force produced by the mass contained in some matter. In the context of general relativity, however, we do away with gravitational force, and instead postulate a curved spacetime geometry that produces all the effects we standardly attribute to gravity. Thus a black hole is not a “thing” in spacetime; it is instead a feature of spacetime itself.

A careful definition of a relativistic black hole will therefore rely only on the geometrical features of spacetime. We'll need to be a little more precise about what it means to be “a region from which nothing, not even light, can escape.” First, there will have to be someplace to escape to if our definition is to make sense. The most common method of making this idea precise and rigorous employs the notion of “escaping to infinity.” If a particle or light ray cannot “travel arbitrarily far” from a definite, bounded region in the interior of spacetime but must remain always in the region, the idea is, then that region is one of no escape, and is thus a black hole. The boundary of the region is called the event horizon. Once a physical entity crosses the event horizon into the hole, it never crosses it again.

Second, we will need a clear notion of the geometry that allows for “escape,” or makes such escape impossible. For this, we need the notion of the “causal structure” of spacetime. At any event in the spacetime, the possible trajectories of all light signals form a cone (or, more precisely, the four-dimensional analog of a cone). Since light travels at the fastest speed allowed in the spacetime, these cones map out the possible causal processes in the spacetime. If an occurence at an event A is able to causally affect another occurence at event B, there must be a continuous trajectory in spacetime from event A to event B such that the trajectory lies in or on the lightcones of every event along it. (For more discussion, see the Supplementary Document: Lightcones and Causal Structure.)

Figure 1 is a spacetime diagram of a sphere of matter collapsing down to form a black hole. The curvature of the spacetime is represented by the tilting of the light cones away from 45 degrees. Notice that the light cones tilt inwards more and more as one approaches the center of the black hole. The jagged line running vertically up the center of the diagram depicts the black hole central singularity. As we emphasized in Section 1, this is not actually part of the spacetime, but might be thought of as an edge of space and time itself. Thus, one should not imagine the possibility of traveling through the singularity; this would be as nonsensical as something's leaving the diagram (i.e., the spacetime) altogether.

Spacetime diagram of black hole formation
Figure 1: A spacetime diagram of black hole formation

What makes this a black hole spacetime is the fact that it contains a region from which it is impossible to exit while traveling at or below the speed of light. This region is marked off by the events at which the outside edge of the forward light cone points straight upward. As one moves inward from these events, the light cone tilts so much that one is always forced to move inward toward the central singularity. This point of no return is, of course, the event horizon; and the spacetime region inside it is the black hole. In this region, one inevitably moves towards the singularity; the impossibility of avoiding the singularity is exactly like the impossibility of preventing ourselves from moving forward in time.

Notice that the matter of the collapsing star disappears into the black hole singularity. All the details of the matter are completely lost; all that is left is the geometrical properties of the black hole which can be identified with mass, charge, and angular momentum. Indeed, there are so-called “no-hair” theorems which make rigorous the claim that a black hole in equilibrium is entirely characterized by its mass, its angular momentum, and its electric charge. This has the remarkable consequence that no matter what the particulars may be of any body that collapses to form a black hole—it may be as intricate, complicated and Byzantine as one likes, composed of the most exotic materials—the final result after the system has settled down to equilibrium will be identical in every respect to a black hole that formed from the collapse of any other body having the same total mass, angular momentum and electric charge. For this reason Chandrasekhar (1983) called black holes “the most perfect objects in the universe.”

4. Naked Singularities and the Cosmic Censorship Hypothesis

While spacetime singularities in general are frequently viewed with suspicion, physicists often offer the reassurance that we expect most of them to be hidden away behind the event horizons of black holes. Such singularities therefore could not affect us unless we were actually tojump into the black hole. A “naked” singularity, on the other hand, is one that is not hidden behind an event horizon. Such singularities appear much more threatening because they are uncontained, accessible to vast areas of spacetime.

The heart of the worry is that singular structure would seem to signify some sort of breakdown in the fundamental structure of spacetime to such a profound depth that it could wreak havoc on any region of universe that it were visible to. Because the structures that break down in singular spacetimes are required for the formulation of our known physical laws in general, and of initial-value problems for individual physical systems in particular, one such fear is that determinism would collapse entirely wherever the singular breakdown were causally visible. As Earman (1995, pp. 65-6) characterizes the worry, nothing would seem to stop the singularity from “disgorging” any manner of unpleasant jetsam, from TVs showing Nixon's Checkers Speech to old lost socks, in a way completely undetermined by the state of spacetime in any region whatsoever, and in such a way as to render strictly indeterminable all regions in causal contact with what it spews out.

One form that such a naked singularity could take is that of a white hole, which is a time-reversed black hole. Imagine taking a film of a black hole forming, and various astronauts, rockets, etc. falling into it. Now imagine that film being run backwards. This is the picture of a white hole: one starts with a naked singularity, out of which might appear people, artifacts, and eventually a star bursting forth. Absolutely nothing in the causal past of such a white hole would determine what would pop out of it (just as items that fall into a black hole leave no trace on the future). Because the field equations of general relativity do not pick out a preferred direction of time, if the formation of a black hole is allowed by the laws of spacetime and gravity, then white holes will also be permitted by these laws.

Roger Penrose famously suggested that although naked singularties are comaptible with general relativity, in physically realistic situations naked singularities will never form; that is, any process that results in a singularity will safely deposit that singularity behind an event horizon. This suggestion, titled the “Cosmic Censorship Hypothesis,” has met with a fair degree of success and popularity; however, it also faces several difficulties.

Penrose's original formulation relied on black holes: a suitably generic singularity will always be contained in a black hole (and so causally invisible outside the black hole). As the counter-examples to various ways of articulating the hypothesis in terms of this idea have accumulated over the years, it has gradually been abandoned.

More recent approaches either begin with an attempt to provide necessary and sufficient conditions for cosmic censorship itself, yielding an indirect characterization of a naked singularity as any phenomenon violating those conditions, or else they begin with an attempt to provide a characterization of a naked singularity and so conclude with a definite statement of cosmic censorship as the absence of such phenomena. The variety of proposals made using both approaches is too great to canvass here; the interested reader is referred to Joshi (2003) for a review of the current state of the art, and to Earman (1995, ch. 3) for a philosophical discussion of many of the proposals.

5. Quantum Black Holes

The challenge of uniting quantum theory and general relativity in a successful theory of quantum gravity has arguably been the greatest challenge facing theoretical physics for the past eighty years. One avenue that has seemed particularly promising here is the attempt to apply quantum theory to black holes. This is in part because, as completely gravitational entities, black holes present an especially pure case to study the quantization of gravity. Further, because the gravitational force grows without bound as one nears a standard black hole singularity, one would expect quantum gravitational effects (which should come into play at extremely high energies) to manifest themselves in black holes.

Studies of quantum mechanics in black hole spacetimes have revealed several surprises that threaten to overturn our traditional views of space, time, and matter. A remarkable parallel between the laws of black hole mechanics and the laws of thermodynamics indicates that spacetime and thermodynamics may be linked in a fundamental (and previously unimagined) way. This linkage hints at a fundamental limitation on how much entropy can be contained in a spatial region. A further topic of foundational importance is found in the so-called information loss paradox, which suggests that standard quantum evolution will not hold when black holes are present. While many of these suggestions are somewhat speculative, they nevertheless touch on deep issues in the foundations of physics.

5.1 Black Hole Thermodynamics

In the early 1970s, Bekenstein argued that the second law of thermodynamics requires one to assign a finite entropy to a black hole. His worry was that one could collapse any amount of highly entropic matter into a black hole — which, as we have emphasized, is an extremely simple object — leaving no trace of the original disorder. This seems to violate the second law of thermodynamics, which asserts that the entropy (disorder) of a closed system can never decrease. However, adding mass to a black hole will increase its size, which led Bekenstein to suggest that the area of a black hole is a measure of its entropy. This conviction grew when, in 1972, Hawking proved that the surface area of a black hole, like the entropy of a closed system, can never decrease.

The similarity between black holes and thermodynamic systems was considerably strengthened when Bardeen, Carter, and Hawking (1973) proved three other laws of black hole mechanics that parallel exactly the first, third, and “zeroth” laws of thermodynamics. Although this parallel was extremely suggestive, taking it seriously would require one to assign a non-zero temperature to a black hole, which all then agreed was absurd: All hot bodies emit thermal radiation (like the heat given off from a stove). However, according to general relativity, a black hole ought to be a perfect sink for energy, mass, and radiation, insofar as it absorbs everything (including light), and emits nothing (including light). The only temperature one might be able to assign it would be absolute zero.

This obvious fact was overthrown when Hawking (1974, 1975) demonstrated that black holes are not completely “black” after all. His analysis of quantum fields in black hole spacetimes revealed that the black holes will emit particles: black holes generate heat at a temperature that is inversely proportional to their mass and directly proportional to their so-called surface gravity. It glows like a lump of smoldering coal even though light should not be able to escape from it! The temperature of this “Hawking effect” radiation is extremely low for stellar-scale black holes, but for very small black holes the temperatures would be quite high. This means that a very small black hole should rapidly evaporate away, as all of its mass-energy is emitted in high-temperature Hawking radiation.

These results were taken to establish that the parallel between the laws of black hole mechanics and the laws of thermodynamics was not a mere fluke: it seems they really are getting at the same deep physics. The Hawking effect establishes that the surface gravity of a black hole can indeed be interpreted as a physical temperature. Further, mass in black hole mechanics is mirrored by energy in thermodynamics, and we know from relativity theory that mass and energy are actually equivalent. Connecting the two sets of laws also requires linking the surface area of a black hole with entropy, as Bekenstein had suggested. This black hole entropy is called its Bekenstein entropy, and is proportional to the area of the event horizon of the black hole.

5.2 The Generalized Second Law of Thermodynamics

In the context of thermodynamic systems containing black holes, one can construct apparent violations of the laws of thermodynamics, and of the laws of black hole mechanics, if one considers these laws to be independent of each other. So for example, if a black hole gives off radiation through the Hawking effect, then it will lose mass – in apparent violation of the area increase theorem. Likewise, as Bekenstein argued, we could violate the second law of thermodynamics by dumping matter with high entropy into a black hole. However, the price of dropping matter into the black hole is that its event horizon will increase in size. Likewise, the price of allowing the event horizon to shrink by giving off Hawking radiation is that the entropy of the external matter fields will go up. We can consider a combination of the two laws that stipulates that the sum of a black hole's area, and the entropy of the system, can never decrease. This is the generalized second law of (black hole) thermodynamics.

From the time that Bekenstein first proposed that the area of a black hole could be a measure of its entropy, it was know to face difficulties that appeared insurmountable. Geroch (1971) proposed a scenario that seems to allow a violation of the generalized second law. If we have a box full of energetic radiation with a high entropy, that box will have a certain weight as it is attracted by the gravitational force of a black hole. One can use this weight to drive an engine to produce energy (e.g., to produce electricity) while slowly lowering the box towards the event horizon of the black hole. This process extracts energy, but not entropy, from the radiation in the box; once the box reaches the event horizon itself, it can have an arbitrarily small amount of energy remaining. If one then opens the box to let the radiation fall into the black hole, the size of the event horizon will not increase any appreciable amount (because the mass-energy of the black hole has barely been increased), but the thermodynamic entropy outside the black hole has decreased. Thus we seem to have violated the generalized second law.

The question of whether we should be troubled by this possible violation of the generalized law touches on several issues in the foundations of physics. The status of the ordinary second law of thermodynamics is itself a thorny philosophical puzzle, quite apart from the issue of black holes. Many physicists and philosophers deny that the ordinary second law holds universally, so one might question whether we should insist on its validity in the presence of black holes. On the other hand, the second law clearly captures some significant feature of our world, and the analogy between black hole mechanics and thermodynamics seems too rich to be thrown out without a fight. Indeed, the generalized second law is our only law that joins together the fields of general relativity, quantum mechanics, and thermodynamics. As such, it seems the most promising window we have into the truly fundamental nature of the physical world.

5.2.1 Entropy Bounds and the Holographic Principle

In response to this apparent violation of the generalized second law, Bekenstein pointed out that one could never get all of the radiation in the box arbitrarily close to the event horizon, because the box itself would have to have some volume. This observation by itself is not enough to save the second law, however, unless there is some limit to how much entropy can be contained in a given volume of space. Current physics poses no such limit, so Bekenstein (1981) postulated that the limit would be enforced by the underlying theory of quantum gravity, which black hole thermodynamics is providing a glimpse of.

However, Unruh and Wald (1982) argue that there is a less ad hoc way to save the generalized second law. The heat given off by any hot body, including a black hole, will produce a kind of “buoyancy” force on any object (like our box) that blocks thermal radiation. This means that when we are lowering our box of high-entropy radiation towards the black hole, the optimal place to release that radiation will not be just above the event horizon, but rather at the “floating point” for the container. Unruh and Wald demonstrate that this fact is enough guarantee that the decrease in outside entropy will be compensated by an increase in the area of the event horizon. It therefore seems that there is no reliable way to violate the generalized second law of black hole thermodynamics.

There is, however, a further reason that one might think that black hole thermodynamics implies a fundamental bound on the amount of entropy that can be contained in a region. Suppose that there were more entropy in some region of space than the Bekenstein entropy of a black hole of the same size. Then one could collapse that entropic matter into a black hole, which obviously could not be larger than the size of the original region (or the mass-energy would have already formed a black hole). But this would violate the generalized second law, for the Bekenstein entropy of a the resulting black hole would be less than that of the matter that formed it. Thus the second law appears to imply a fundamental limit on how much entropy a region can contain. If this is right, it seems to be a deep insight into the nature of quantum gravity.

Arguments along these lines led ‘t Hooft (1985) to postulate the “Holographic Principle” (though the title is due to Susskind). This principle claims that the number of fundamental degrees of freedom in any spherical region is given by the Bekenstein entropy of a black hole of the same size as that region. The Holographic Principle is notable not only because it postulates a well-defined, finite, number of degrees of freedom for any region, but also because this number grows as the area surrounding the region, and not as the volume of the region. This flies in the face of standard physical pictures, whether of particles or fields. According to that picture, the entropy is the number of possible ways something can be, and that number of ways increases as the volume of any spatial region. The Holographic Principle does get some support from a result in string theory known as the “AdS/CFT correspondence.” If the Principle is correct, then one spatial dimension can, in a sense, be viewed as superfluous: the fundamental physical story of a spatial region is actually a story that can be told merely about the boundary of the region.

5.2.2 What Does Black Hole Entropy Measure?

In classical thermodynamics, that a system possesses entropy is often attributed to the fact that we in practice are never able to render to it a “complete” description. When describing a cloud of gas, we do not specify values for the position and velocity of every molecule in it; we rather describe it in terms of quantities, such as pressure and temperature, constructed as statistical measures over underlying, more finely grained quantities, such as the momentum and energy of the individual molecules. The entropy of the gas then measures the incompleteness, as it were, of the gross description. In the attempt to take seriously the idea that a black hole has a true physical entropy, it is therefore natural to attempt to construct such a statistical origin for it. The tools of classical general relativity cannot provide such a construction, for it allows no way to describe a black hole as a system whose physical attributes arise as gross statistical measures over underlying, more finely grained quantities. Not even the tools of quantum field theory on curved spacetime can provide it, for they still treat the black hole as an entity defined entirely in terms of the classical geometry of the spacetime. Any such statistical accounting, therefore, must come from a theory that attributes to the classical geometry a description in terms of an underlying, discrete collection of micro-states. Explaining what these states are that are counted by the Bekenstein entropy has been a challenge that has been eagerly pursued by quantum gravity researchers.

In 1996, superstring theorists were able to give an account of how M-theory (which is an extension of superstring theory) generates a number of the string-states for a certain class of black holes, and this number matched that given by the Bekenstein entropy (Strominger and Vafa, 1996). A counting of black hole states using loop quantum gravity has also recovered the Bekenstein entropy (Ashtekar et al., 1998). It is philosophically noteworthy that this is treated as a significant success for these theories (i.e., it is presented as a reason for thinking that these theories are on the right track) even though Hawking radiation has never been experimentally observed (in part, because for macroscopic black holes the effect is minute).

5.3 Information Loss Paradox

Hawking's discovery that black holes give off radiation presented an apparent problem for the possibility of describing black holes quantum mechanically. According to standard quantum mechanics, the entropy of a closed system never changes; this is captured formally by the “unitary” nature of quantum evolution. Such evolution guarantees that the initial conditions, together with the quantum Schrödinger equation, will fix the future state of the system. Likewise, a reverse application of the Schrödinger equation will take us from the later state back to the original initial state. The states at each time are rich enough, detailed enough, to fix (via the dynamical equations) the states at all other times. Thus there is a sense in which the completeness of the state is maintained by unitary time evolution.

It is typical to characterize this feature with the claim that quantum evolution “preserves information.” If one begins with a system in a precisely known quantum state, then unitary evolution guarantees that the details about that system will evolve in such a way that one can infer the precise quantum state of the system at some later time (as long as one knows the law of evolution and can perform the relevant calculations), and vice versa. This quantum preservation of details implies that if we burn a chair, for example, it would in principle be possible to perform a complete set of measurements on all the outgoing radiation, the smoke, and the ashes, and reconstruct exactly what the chair looked like. However, if we were instead to throw the chair into a black hole, then it would be physically impossible for the details about the chair ever to escape to the outside universe. This might not be a problem if the black hole continued to exist for all time, but Hawking tells us that the black hole is giving off energy, and thus it will shrink down and presumably will eventually disappear altogether. At that point, the details about the chair will be irrevocably lost; thus such evolution cannot be described unitarily. This problem has been labeled the “information loss paradox” of quantum black holes.

(A brief technical explanation for those familiar with quantum mechanics: The argument is simply that the interior and the exterior of the black hole will generally be entangled. However, microcausality implies that the entangled degrees of freedom in the black hole cannot coherently recombine with the external universe. Thus once the black hole has completely evaporated away, the entropy of the universe will have increased — in violation of unitary evolution.)

The attitude physicists adopted towards this paradox was apparently strongly influenced by their vision of which theory, general relativity or quantum theory, would have to yield to achieve a consistent theory of quantum gravity. Spacetime physicists tended to view non-unitary evolution as a fairly natural consequence of singular spacetimes: one wouldn't expect all the details to be available at late times if they were lost in a singularity. Hawking, for example, argued that the paradox shows that the full theory of quantum gravity will be a non-unitary theory, and he began working to develop such a theory. (He has since abandoned this position.)

However, particle physicists (such as superstring theorists) tended to view black holes as being just another quantum state. If two particles were to collide at extremely high (i.e., Planck-scale) energies, they would form a very small black hole. This tiny black hole would have a very high Hawking temperature, and thus it would very quickly give off many high-energy particles and disappear. Such a process would look very much like a standard high-energy scattering experiment: two particles collide and their mass-energy is then converted into showers of outgoing particles. The fact that all known scattering processes are unitary then seems to give us some reason to expect that black hole formation and evaporation should also be unitary.

These considerations led many physicists to propose scenarios that might allow for the unitary evolution of quantum black holes, while not violating other basic physical principles, such as the requirement that no physical influences be allowed to travel faster than light (the requirement of “microcausality”), at least not when we are far from the domain of quantum gravity (the “Planck scale”). Once energies do enter the domain of quantum gravity, e.g. near the central singularity of a black hole, then we might expect the classical description of spacetime to break down; thus, physicists were generally prepared to allow for the possibility of violations of microcausality in this region.

A very helpful overview of this debate can be found in Belot, Earman, and Ruetsche (1999). Most of the scenarios proposed to escape Hawking's argument faced serious difficulties and have been abandoned by their supporters. The proposal that currently enjoys the most wide-spread (though certainly not universal) support is known as “black hole complementarity.” This proposal has been the subject of philosophical controversy because it includes apparently incompatible claims, and then tries to escape the contradiction by making a controversial appeal to quantum complementarity or (so charge the critics) verificationism.

5.3.1 Black Hole Complementarity

The challenge of saving information from a black hole lies in the fact that it is impossible to copy the quantum details (especially the quantum correlations) that are preserved by unitary evolution. This implies that if the details pass behind the event horizon, for example, if an astronaut falls into a black hole, then those details are lost forever. Advocates of black hole complementarity (Susskind et al. 1993), however, point out that an outside observer will never see the infalling astronaut pass through the event horizon. Instead, as we saw in Section 2, she will seem to hover at the horizon for all time. But all the while, the black hole will also be giving off heat, and shrinking down, and getting hotter, and shrinking more. The black hole complementarian therefore suggests that an outside observer should conclude that the infalling astronaut gets burned up before she crosses the event horizon, and all the details about her state will be returned in the outgoing radiation, just as would be the case if she and her belongings were incinerated in a more conventional manner; thus the information (and standard quantum evolution) is saved.

However, this suggestion flies in the face of the fact (discussed earlier) that for an infalling observer, nothing out of the ordinary should be experienced at the event horizon. Indeed, for a large enough black hole, one wouldn't even know that she was passing through an event horizon at all. This obviously contradicts the suggestion that she might be burned up as she passes through the horizon. The black hole complementarian tries to resolve this contradiction by agreeing that the infalling observer will notice nothing remarkable at the horizon. This is followed by a suggestion that the account of the infalling astronaut should be considered to be “complementary” to the account of the external observer, rather in the same way that position and momentum are complementary descriptions of quantum particles (Susskind et al. 1993). The fact that the infalling observer cannot communicate to the external world that she survived her passage through the event horizon is supposed to imply that there is no genuine contradiction here.

This solution to the information loss paradox has been criticized for making an illegitimate appeal to verificationism (Belot, Earman, and Ruetsche 1999). However, the proposal has nevertheless won wide-spread support in the physics community, in part because models of M-theory seem to behave somewhat as the black hole complementarian scenario suggests (for a philosophical discussion, see van Dongen and de Haro 2004). Bokulich (2005) argues that the most fruitful way of viewing black hole complementarity is as a novel suggestion for how a non-local theory of quantum gravity will recover the local behavior of quantum field theory when black holes are involved.

6. Conclusion: Philosophical Issues

The physical investigation of spacetime singularities and black holes has touched on numerous philosophical issues. To begin, we were confronted with the question of the definition and significance of singularities. Should they be defined in terms of incomplete paths, missing points, or curvature pathology? Should we even think that there is a single correct answer to this question? Need we include such things in our ontology, or do they instead merely indicate the break-down of a particular physical theory? Are they “edges” of spacetime, or merely inadequate descriptions that will be dispensed with by a truly fundamental theory of quantum gravity?

This has obvious connections to the issue of how we are to interpret the ontology of merely effective physical descriptions. The debate over the information loss paradox also highlights the conceptual importance of the relationship between different effective theories. At root, the debate is over where and how our effective physical theories will break down: when can they be trusted, and where must they be replaced by a more adequate theory?

Black holes appear to be crucial for our understanding of the relationship between matter and spacetime. As discussed in Section 3, When matter forms a black hole, it is transformed into a purely gravitational entity. When a black hole evaporates, spacetime curvature is transformed into ordinary matter. Thus black holes offer an important arena for investigating the ontology of spacetime and ordinary objects.

Black holes were also seen to provide an important testing ground to investigate the conceptual problems underlying quantum theory and general relativity. The question of whether black hole evolution is unitary raises the issue of how the unitary evolution of standard quantum mechanics serves to guarantee that no experiment can reveal a violation of energy conservation or of microcausality. Likewise, the debate over the information loss paradox can be seen as a debate over whether spacetime or an abstract dynamical state space (Hilbert space) should be viewed as being more fundamental. Might spacetime itself be an emergent entity belonging only to an effective physical theory?

Singularities and black holes are arguably our best windows into the details of quantum gravity, which would seem to be the best candidate for a truly fundamental physical description of the world (if such a fundamental description exists). As such, they offer glimpses into deepest nature of matter, dynamical laws, and space and time; and these glimpses seem to call for a conceptual revision at least as great as that required by quantum mechanics or relativity theory alone.

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space and time: inertial frames | space and time: the hole argument | time machines

Acknowledgments

The SEP editors would like to thank John D. Norton, the subject editor for this entry, for the special effort he made in refereeing and guiding this entry towards publication.