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Suhrawardi

First published Wed Dec 26, 2007; substantive revision Wed Apr 4, 2012

Trained in Avicennan Peripateticism, Shihab al-Din al-Suhrawardi (1154–1191) became the founder of an Illuminationist (ishraqi) philosophical tradition in the Islamic East. Since none of his works were translated into Latin, he remained unknown in the West; but from the 13th century onwards, his works were studied in a number of philosophical circles in the Islamic East. In the mid-20th century, Henry Corbin worked relentlessly to edit and study his writings, which led to renewed interest in Suhrawardi's works and thought, especially in the later part of the 20th century.

Suhrawardi provided an original Platonic criticism of the dominant Avicennan Peripateticism of the time in the fields of logic, epistemology, psychology, and metaphysics, while simultaneously elaborating his own epistemological (logic and psychology) and metaphysical (ontology and cosmology) Illuminationist theories. His new epistemological perspective led him to critique the Avicennan Peripatetic theory of definition, introduce a theory of ‘presential’ knowledge, elaborate a complex ontology of lights, and add a fourth ‘imaginal’ world.

1. Life and Works

1.1 Life

Biographical data on the life of Shihab al-Din al-Suhrawardi, the ‘master of illumination’ (shaykh al-ishraq), is scarce. Born in the northwestern Iranian village of Suhraward in 1154, he pursued his education in nearby Maraghah with Majd al-Din al-Jili, one of the teachers of Fakhr al-Din al-Razi (d.1209). He then traveled to Isfahan, where he studied with the logician Zahir al-Farisi with whom he read a text on logic written by Ibn Sahlan al-Sawi (d.ca.1170). Suhrawardi then embarked on a journey that led him to Anatolia. Shams al-Din al-Shahrazuri (d.ca.1288) identifies this period as his quest for spiritual guidance, a period when he would have met a number of Sufi masters, such as Fakhr al-Din al-Maridini (d.1198), and would have sought patrons among the local rulers of Anatolia.

In 1183, Suhrawardi arrived in Aleppo, the year Saladin (d.1193) conquered that city and handed it over to his son al-Zahir (d.1216). Suhrawardi, a Shafi‘i Sunni, made a name for himself among religious scholars of the city, such as Iftikhar al-Din. He eventually managed to secure an audience at the palace and to befriend al-Zahir. In 1186, he completed his most important work, the Philosophy of Illumination (hereafter, PI), at the age of thirty-three. Unfortunately, he also succeeded in alienating the powerful religious elite of Aleppo on whom the Ayyubids depended for the legitimacy of their rule over the city.

A combination of religious and political factors led to Suhrawardi's downfall. On the one hand, he was accused of holding heretical beliefs, a vague charge easily sustained with pre-Islamic Persian names and symbols that some of his works contain, his claim to divine-like inspiration, and his questioning, in light of God's omnipotence, the logical finality of Prophethood. On the other hand, his earlier and close relationships with the rulers of the recently conquered Artuqids of southwest Anatolia or with al-Zahir, the Ayyubid ruler, may have been interpreted as political intrigue. In the end, Suhrawardi's fate was sealed with accusations of heresy (rather than treason). Biographers and historians remain at odds over the exact charges and course of events that led to his execution at the end of 1191 (or early1192) (Marcotte 2001a).

1.2 Works

Suhrawardi's works are traditionally divided into four categories: several early works, a number of mystical or allegorical texts, many written in Persian (Suhrawardi 1976; 1993c; 1999b), minor works which often present Peripatetic ideas and methods, but which also contain distinctive Illuminationist theses, e.g., his Temples of Light (Suhrawardi 1996), and, finally, his four major Arabic works which Suhrawardi intended to be studied in the following order: the Intimations (Suhrawardi, 2009 [logic, physics, metaphysics]; cf. Ibn Kammuna 2003, 2009), the Oppositions (Suhrawardi 1993a), the Paths and Conversations (Suhrawardi 1993a), and the Philosophy of Illumination (Suhrawardi 1993b; 1999a; 1986). In the latter work, Suhrawardi developed his Illuminationist philosophy in detail, wherein the symbolism of Light becomes central in his reconfigurations of cosmology and ontology.

Needless to say, such a classification, as well as the theory of two distinct periods in Suhrawardi's life and works — Peripatetic, followed by Illuminationist — poses some difficulties. The classification may well be merely heuristic, as it fails to account for a number of works that expound Peripatetic principles and methods and yet include a number of Illuminationist principles, e.g., in his Tablets Dedicated to ‘Imad al-Din (Suhrawardi 1976: 99-116) and in his Temples of Light (Suhrawardi 1996; 1976: 139–47). Although Suhrawardi mentions that he was “once zealous in defense of the Peripatetic path” (PI, 108.8–9), a period during which time he may have written such works as the Flashes of Light (a précis of Avicennan Peripatetic theses) whose attribution to a specifically identifiable ‘pre-inspiration’ period remains problematic; The Flashes of Light, however, mentions both the Intimations and the Philosophy of Illumination as completed works (Suhrawardi 1993a: 70.3–7). Although Suhrawardi asserts that his Intimations was a work written according to the Peripatetic tradition, the work contains some of his more distinctive Illuminationist positions (Suhrawardi 1993a: 70–7 and 105–21).

Suhrawardi composed most of his treatises over a very short span of time, most probably during the course of about ten years. The brevity of this period would not have left him much time to undergo a radical transformation through two different and successive stages in which he would have espoused two distinct styles and modes of thought. For Suhrawardi, a great number of valid Peripatetic principles remain necessary for understanding his Illuminationist Philosophy. Henry Corbin (d.1978) noted that there may not have been a purely Peripatetic period, though Suhrawardi confessed he once defended the Peripatetic approach. Very few of his works can, in fact, be dated; whereas a number of his works were written simultaneously.

Suhrawardi's works circulated mainly within the traditional philosophical circles of learning of the Islamic East until the end of the 19th and the beginning of the 20th centuries when, in the wake of the works of Carra de Vaux, Max Horten (1912), Louis Massignon, Otto Spies and Khatak (1935), and Helmut Ritter, the French Iranologist Henry Corbin began to study and edit a great number of his works. A first volume, published in Istanbul in 1945, contained the metaphysics of Suhrawardi's first three major Arabic works (Suhrawardi 1993a). In 1952, Corbin then edited Suhrawardi's magnum opus, the Arabic Philosophy of Illumination (Suhrawardi 1993b; 1999a; 1986), together with two minor works. Corbin then went on to write his major study on Suhrawardi et les platoniciens de Perse (Corbin 1971; cf. Abu Rayyan 1969). In 1970, Seyyed Hossein Nasr edited fourteen of Suhrawardi's Persian texts (two attributed to him), many of which are allegorical or mystical in nature (Suhrawardi 1993c).

1.3 Influences on Suhrawardi

Mapping Suhrawardi's intellectual trajectory and identifying the sources which he may have used has proven exceedingly difficult (Walbridge 2000, 2001; cf. Gutas 2003). Suhrawardi was undoubtedly instructed in the Avicennan Peripatetic tradition (in Maragha and Isfahan), but this would have also included the study of the ideas of Aristotle, Plato and, most importantly, of the Neoplatonists and earlier philosophers who wrote in Arabic. Avicenna's (d.1037) works were undoubtedly central. Much work still needs to be done to assess the real significance of Avicenna's Discussions (1992) and his Notes on Aristotle's De anima (1984) on Suhrawardi, as well as the nature of the influence exerted on him by post-Avicennan philosophers, in particular, Abu al-Barakat al-Baghdadi (d.ca.1150), the original, yet eclectic critic of Avicenna's logic, psychology and metaphysics, and the logician Ibn Sahlan al-Sawi.

The influence of both Plato and Aristotle remains readily identifiable in Suhrawardi's works. Attempts have been made to trace the Greek influences of such figures as Empedocles, Pythagoras, and the Stoics, an exercise which has led to Suhrawardi being labeled a ‘Pythagoreanizing Neoplatonist’ (Walbridge 2000; 2001), but with more or less success (see Gutas 2003: 308). Notwithstanding Suhrawardi's frequent appeals to the authority of Plato, another, more fruitful area of research might rest with such works as the Arabic Theology of Aristotle (a paraphrase of parts of Books IV-VI of Plotinus’ Enneads), in particular, the passages it contains from Enneads IV, 8.1, where the names of many philosophers of the Greek tradition important to Suhrawardi are mentioned.

Charting Suhrawardi's intellectual journey and encounters with mysticism, ancient Greek Gnosticism and Hermeticism, or ancient Persian Zoroastrian traditions, to whose symbols he often appeals, remains exceedingly difficult. In addition, no one has as yet fully explored the possible influences of Ismailism or Sufism on Suhrawardi; his Illuminationist doctrine could have more affinity with Ismaili thought (such as the hierarchical notion of being in the works of 10th century Abu Ya‘qub al-Sijistani) than with the doctrines of classical Sufis whom he claims to be following (Landolt 1987), although similarities with certain Sufi theories have been noted (Landolt 2007). Medieval biographers, on the other hand, readily reported Suhrawardi's mystical inclination, his association with mystics, his ascetic practices and (hagiographic) wondrous deeds. Suhrawardi himself considered spiritual exercises a necessary preparation for the advent of presential knowledge and vision of the Lights. He often appealed to ancient Zoroastrian motifs, terminology and mythical figures, even Mazdean theology, e.g., in his Invocations and Prayers (Suhrawardi, 1976; cf. with occult and devotional works unearthed by Walbridge, 2011). His appeal to angels as embodiments of the intellective principles, for example, shares much with ancient Zoroastrian angelology (Corbin 1972: 111–3, 124–5), but also with the angelology found in Abu al-Barakat al-Baghdadi's Considerations (1939, vol. 2: 157; cf. Pines 1979: 253–5), the latter, however, being devoid of any ancient Persian symbolism. Without any clear historical filiations to particular textual traditions, one can only rely on Suhrawardi's own claims to having intended to provide a synthesis of these ancient Western and Eastern intellectual traditions. Why Suhrawardi “presented himself as following these ancient philosophers, and especially Plato, rather than Avicenna” has yet to be elucidated and adequately explained (Gutas 2003: 309).

2. Logic

2.1 Role of Logic

Very little has been written about Suhrawardi's logical treatises or his logic in general. Ziai (1990) provides perhaps the only general overview of Suhrawardi's logic, his criticism of Peripatetic (Aristotelian) essentialist definitions and his own elaboration of an Illuminationist theory of definition. While Suhrawardi includes logical discussions in his major Arabic works, in his Philosophy of Illumination, he ventures a criticism and a restructuring of some elements of Avicennan Peripatetic logic.

The Philosophy of Illumination does not follow the customary Avicennan tripartite division into logic, physics, and metaphysics which was standard in Post-Avicennan Peripatetic works. Instead, Suhrawardi begins with a small number of useful ‘Rules of Thought’ (PI, 14–105) that cover not only logic, but also elements of physics and metaphysics which, according to his 13th century commentator Shahrazuri, are rules derived from the Avicennan Peripatetic corpus (Ziai 1990: 41–76). Suhrawardi first introduces elements of semantics, where he discusses problems of meaning, conception, assent and the nature, the definition and the description of ‘reality’ (haqiqa), the latter being equated by Qutb al-Din Shirazi (d.1311) with quiddity (mahiyya). Suhrawardi also discusses accidents, universals (adopting a more or less nominalist position), innate (fitriyya) and non innate human knowledge and the notion of definition and its elements (PI, 8.20–11.9). He then proceeds with short discussions on the conditions of proofs, on defining propositions, their classes and modalities, and includes a number of discussions on contradiction, conversion, and some syllogisms (reductio ad absurdum and demonstrative syllogisms). Suhrawardi identifies some errors of formal and material logic with the logic of the Peripatetics (an epitome of the Sophistical Refutations). He even includes brief discussions on dialectics, rhetoric, and poetics whose premises he considers non-scientific and thus part of non demonstrative syllogisms (Ziai 1990: 41–74). He criticizes the Peripatetics’ understanding of negation, as well as the second and third figures of the syllogism. He reduces all types of propositions to necessary affirmative propositions and discusses some of the differences between the Peripatetics and the Illuminationists regarding a number of sophisms. Suhrawardi even revisits the classical theory of the ten Categories which (as with the Stoics) he lumps together and reduces to five: substance, quality, quantity, relation, and motion, of which the latter four are accidental categories. The Categories now become ‘degrees of intensity’ (or perfection) of light that entities possess and that they emit, rather than being merely distinct ‘ontic entities’ (Ziai 2003: 452). As such, the degree of intensity (with its corollary ‘weakness’) of light becomes a property of substances as well as of accidents.

2.2 Definition

Suhrawardi criticizes the Peripatetic theory of definition and the inductive approach it advocates as a foundation for scientific knowledge and demonstration. He uses logical and semantic arguments to question ‘essentialist’ types of definitions (Aristotelian) on which Avicenna's own ‘complete (essentialist) definition’ depends. He rejects the claims that it is possible to obtain a complete definition that could encompass all the essential constituents needed to lead to the knowledge of that which is previously unknown and in need of a definition (Ziai 1990: 77–114). Suhrawardi writes that “it is clear that it is impossible for a human being to construct an essential definition in the way the Peripatetics require—a difficulty which even their master [Aristotle] admits. Therefore, we have definition only by means of things that specify conjunction” (PI, 11.5–9). He insists that a definition should enumerate, in some kind of unitary formula, all the essential elements of the described object. He therefore includes elements of definition by extension (enumeration of members of a ‘class’) and of definition by intension (enumeration of defining property or properties), for example, that “the essence of man, which is the truth underlying the symbol ‘man’, is recoverable only in the subject. The act of ‘recovery’ is the translation of the symbol to its equivalent in the consciousness or the self of the subject” (Ziai 2003: 448–9). Suhrawardi explains his ‘conceptualist’ notion of definition at greater length in his Paths and Conversations (Ziai 1990: 110). His epistemological critique of the Peripatetic theory of definition is undoubtedly inspired by Abu al-Barakat al-Baghdadi's own critical evaluation of the Isagoge which was developed in his Considerations (1939: vol. 1, 55–7; cf. Ziai 1990: 183–4), but also by Suhrawardi's own understanding of the epistemic role of self-knowledge.

Suhrawardi proceeds by introducing his reformulation of an Illuminationist theory of definition that signals what some have identified as a ‘Platonic’ or ‘Neoplatonic’ turn (Ziai 1990: 114–128). Now, only direct experience guarantees acquisition of true knowledge, such that epistemological considerations are at the heart of his reconceptualization of the definition. Suhrawardi's theory of definition thus builds on a Platonic epistemology. Knowledge of the reality of things occurs through the direct apprehension of the intrinsic light-nature (the thing as it is) of all entities (see metaphysics below). Direct knowledge occurs through ‘vision-illumination’, as a person realizes that what is to be defined becomes available to one's self through self-consciousness. At such time, the soul becomes directly aware of the reality of that which is to be defined. The soul is then able to grasp directly these essences whose elements can then be translated using proofs and demonstrations to develop a discursive type of knowledge about that original apperception of reality.

Suhrawardi writes that, in and of itself, light is not in need of any definition, because all that is required is for light to be experienced, as there is nothing more evident than light. In his Paths and Conversations, Suhrawardi writes that to define something is to actually ‘see’ the thing as it really is (Ziai 1990: 104–14). Suhrawardi begins the second part of his Philosophy of Illumination by stating that “anything in existence that requires no definition or explanation is evident. Since there is nothing more evident than light, there is nothing less in need of definition” (PI, 76), thereby establishing the centrality of the concept of light for his Illuminationist ontology and epistemology. Suhrawardi argues that only direct intuitive experience can lead to knowledge of the reality (haqiqa) of things, which definitions can only attempt to describe and explain via a posteriori rational investigations or demonstrations (Ziai 1990: 81). Qutb al-Din Shirazi noted that Illuminationist epistemology relied on this type of personal and intuitive knowledge, itself not in need of any definition (Ziai 1990: 133).

3. Physics

Suhrawardi's Intimations, Paths and Conversations, and Oppositions contain substantial sections on physics, although all have remained unstudied. At present, only the physics of the Intimations has been edited, together with a commentary by Ibn Kammuna (2003). In the Philosophy of Illumination, Suhrawardi deals mainly with some general principles of physics, but not with any kind of detail. With his philosophy of lights, he manages, nonetheless, to reconfigure some elements of physics. He criticizes, for example, the Peripatetic hylomorphic division of matter and form, since hylomorphism becomes incompatible with the ontic luminosity of reality. Immaterial entities and material bodies that are composed of varying degrees of light remain ‘unitary concrete entities’. The physical world is composed of dusky substances with dark accidents, while self-subsistent magnitude appears to replace prime matter which, like a number of traditional physical notions, becomes a mere mental concept that has no reality outside the mind. It is no longer the perception of the form of objects, but their constitutive lights that becomes the true object of knowledge (Walbridge 2000: 22–3).

3.1 Psychology

Suhrawardi equally revisits Avicenna's psychology. The soul remains an immaterial, self-subsisting, living, knowing substance, capable of ruling over the body, but now defined in terms of its luminosity. A relation of dominion and desire is established between the luminous substance of the soul and the tenebrous substance of the body. Between the two, the psychic pneuma functions as an intermediary that is able to receive images, forms or ‘icons’ of metaphysical realities that it then reflects and manifests into the soul.

Vision remains the most important sense. It is integrated into Suhrawardi's Illuminationist theory of vision and incorporated into his theory of knowledge by presence. Suhrawardi begins with a criticism and a rejection of the prevalent ‘extramissive’ and ‘intromissive’ theories of vision on account of the materialist implications of the imprinting of forms in the material substratum of the eye. Although mediated by a physical organ, vision remains primarily an activity of the human soul, whereby the soul accesses directly the reality of the objects of vision. In the Philosophy of Illumination, the vision of physical objects requires, first, a ‘presential’ face-to-face encounter of that which perceives, both the physical organ and the human soul, and the illuminated object; second, the absence of obstacles between subject and object, often described in mystical terms as the absence of veils, whereby the soul becomes illuminated by the (substantial or accidental) light of the object; and finally, the presence of light, the necessary condition for the establishment of an Illuminationist relation. Vision thus unfolds simultaneously on two different planes, physical visual perception being reduced to the soul's perception or awareness of the intrinsic and essential light possessed by the object. True vision does not require the presence and transmission of forms, but occurs through the soul's ability to be aware of the essential light-reality of the object. Physics and metaphysics thus merge, as objects have the ability to receive and emit light, though only in an accidental manner, light being precisely what the light-soul, the Isfahbad-light, is able to perceive, whether it be through the senses, the intellect, intuition, or dreams (PI, 240.4–241.4).

Suhrawardi criticizes the localization of the internal faculties in different parts of the brain, as their localization in a material organ again naturalizes the process of representation. Internal faculties now become shadows (or functions) of the soul, lumped together into a single faculty responsible for representation. The Isfahbad-light principle accesses the supernal lights, rules over the active imagination, and reflects onto it the lights it receives. The faculty of representation perceives particulars, while the ruling light, the Isfahbad-light principle guaranteeing the unity of the soul, perceives universals and immaterial entities. The new emphasis on the totality of the soul, as the main perceiving entity, and the reduction of the Avicennan faculties traditionally responsible for representation to a single faculty could find their origin in Abu al-Barakat al-Baghdadi's Considerations (1939, vol. 2: 318-24; cf. Pines 1979: 227–31). As for recollection, Suhrawardi defines it in a rather Platonic manner, whereby it becomes the retrieval of images (or concepts) whose existence lies in the ‘world of memorial’, accessible only to the luminous part of the soul.

Illumination becomes a metaphor for the intellective process. Illuminative relations are established between metaphysical active light principles and the human soul. Whereas only the (rational) Isfahbad-light part of the soul is immortal, Suhrawardi, nevertheless, notes the possibility for the imaginative faculty of souls that have not yet achieved perfection to perhaps survive, something that is required for the experiencing of divine retribution and for the perfecting of souls in the afterlife. The spheres of Ether and Zamharir, both situated below the Moon and associated with the world of elements, are identified as possible ‘pneumatic’ substrata for the posthumous activities of the imaginative faculties of those souls (Suhrawardi 1993c: 245.5–7). Suhrawardi attempted, therefore, to postulate the existence of an independent eschatological realm with the assistance of which sensitive perceptions could occur in the form of imaginal representations (Marcotte, 2011). Finally, he does not appear to completely reject the possibility of some kind of transmigration of souls, especially of miserable souls, in spite of the fact that he does not overtly affirm it and that many other passages seem to deny it (Schmidtke 1999).

3.2 Epistemology

Suhrawardi's Illuminationist epistemology revolves around his theory of ‘presential’ (huduri) knowledge that one is able to achieve through intuitive apprehension or contemplative vision (mushahada). Qutb al-Din Shirazi noted the importance of continuous practice of spiritual exercises for the occurrence of such intuitive and mystical aptitudes to access true reality. The ‘Plotinian’ (cf. Enneads V 3.6) Aristotle figure of Suhrawardi's famous dream-vision found in his Intimations (cf. Walbridge 2000: 225–9) provides us with an illustrious example of what constitutes, for Suhrawardi, real knowledge based on immediate and intuitive knowledge. Whereas the Peripatetics had extolled intellection, Suhrawardi brings direct intuition or mystical contemplation (heightened by ascetic components) to the forefront, as an alternative — albeit more reliable — foundation of certainty. Intuitive knowledge provides access to a priori truths of which discursive knowledge can only be subsequently validated through a posteriori demonstrations (Dinani 1985; Ha’iri Yazdi 1992; Aminrazavi 1997; 2003).

Suhrawardi explores some of the issues raised by the hypothetical example of the ‘suspended’ person found in Avicenna's Discussions and his Notes on Aristotle's De anima, and his treatments of the soul in the Cure and the Salvation. He analyzes the notions of apperception and self-awareness and alludes to a pre-logical mode of perception that remains distinct from intellection. He discusses the primary awareness of the soul's existence, its self-identity, the unmediated character of this particular type of knowledge and issues of individuation. He provides various arguments to demonstrate the existence of a type of knowledge that is self-evident, a priori and unmediated through any type of abstraction and representation of forms, whether it be through an image, a form, a notion or an attribute of the self. The perception of pain becomes paradigmatic of self-knowledge as unmediated perception, i.e., a non discursive, non-conceptual and non-propositional type of knowledge that, nonetheless, does constitute a mode of knowing distinct from discursive knowledge. Similar to pain, self-knowledge provides yet another illustration of the type of epistemic process that Suhrawardi considers being at the heart of intuitive knowledge. The unmediated nature of this process characterizes both the soul's self-knowledge and the soul's knowledge of supernal entities and the glimpses of the Light of Lights it may obtain (Marcotte 2006; see the more recent studies of Kaukua, 2011 and Eichner, 2011).

In Suhrawardi's ‘science of lights’, the object of perception — light — cannot be known discursively, but only through an immediate presence or awareness of its luminosity. Mystical vision and contemplation operate through this intuitive process of knowing metaphysical lights. Individuals achieve such states through spiritual and ascetic practices that enable them to detach themselves from the darknesses of the world in their quest for the apperception of those lights. Intuitive knowledge thus constitutes a superior means of accessing the luminous reality and the divine realm of metaphysical truths.

Suhrawardi appears to spiritualize Avicenna's Peripatetic epistemology with a greatly Platonic reading, now that the access to the ultimate reality is guaranteed through divine photic illumination. His classification of learned men according to their respective merits in discursive (philosophy) and intuitive (mystical) knowledge is revealing. Direct intuition or mystical contemplation plays a predominant role, even for prophets. Prophetic knowledge relies on the functions of the faculty of imagination, i.e., its mimetic function and its role in the particularization of universal truths. Prophecy becomes the ‘direct’ experience of the world of lights. Suhrawardi also introduces an independent imaginal realm to account for the ability of prophets and other gifted individuals to access divine metaphysical realms where imaginal forms already exist. Such individuals are either commissioned or uncommissioned to receive and transmit God's message, the prophets being those who are among the privileged commissioned.

Direct intuition lies at the heart of Suhrawardi's prophetology, inasmuch as only the most perfect sage who witnesses those truths, whether he be a prophet or not, deserves God's viceregency, by being either a living proof or in occultation. Individuals who have access to those metaphysical lights can be invested with the viceregency of God, depending on the degree of their receptivity and the purity of their hearts. On the whole, however, the epistemic process by which mystics such as Abu Yazid al-Bistami (d.874), Sahl al-Tustari (d.896) and Hallaj (d.912), sages such as Zarathustra and Empedocles, philosophers such as Pythagoras and Plato, or Suhrawardi himself have all had access to those metaphysical truths and divine realms remains quite similar to the process by which prophets have accessed the same divine and metaphysical truths. Liberated from the enslavement of the material world, their Isfahbad-light souls become receptive to illumination and perceive truths similar to those perceived by prophets. Prophetic and mystical knowledge only occur once the human soul is able to conjoin with those metaphysical lights. The soul is able to acquire a luminous and theurgic power, mediated by the active imagination which existentiates images and forms that have been reflected, in a mirror-like manner, onto it. It can imitate and reproduce forms that it has received from non-sensible realms, as it short-circuits all incoming external and sensible data. The faculty of active imagination then projects those matters onto the ‘common sense’ which provides a sensible form to those divine metaphysical realities that they did not originally possess.

4. Metaphysics

In his Philosophy of Illumination, Suhrawardi develops a complex metaphysic of ‘divine’ lights. Light, the lynchpin of his metaphysics, structures his ontology and cosmology at the heart of which lies a spectrum of light and darkness that shapes the whole of reality. In his Intimations (1993a: 2.11–3.16), philosophy is divided into theoretical and practical components, where the practical includes ethics, economics and politics, while the theoretical is concerned with immaterial realities, the highest theoretical component being concerned with absolute being (wujud).

4.1 Essence and Existence

The concept of light manages to ‘disrupt’ classical Peripatetic ontology by somehow rendering irrelevant the Avicennan distinction between essence and existence in contingent beings (Rizvi 2000). Perhaps following Aristotle, Avicenna favored the primacy of essence over existence, the latter considered an abstract concept. Suhrawardi criticized and rejected the Peripatetic logical distinction between the two concepts, insisting that the concept of existence is added to quiddity in re, such that the general extension of the concept of existence remains a mental predicate, not a real one. For Suhrawardi, concepts such as essence and existence considered a priori and real were “merely mental considerations (i‘tibari) with no corresponding reality” (Rizvi 1999: 222).

The primacy of light signals a shift in the understanding of the very nature of the ‘essence’ of things. The degree or intensity of light of essences makes them distinct from one another, although they all share in the same light whose origins remain with the Light of Lights. Everything partakes in and of light, in an almost infinite manner. The distinction between essence and existence no longer becomes appropriate to assert contingency and only remains notional, since the difference between necessary and contingent beings now depends on whether a being possesses light in itself or light for other than itself (Rizvi 1999: 223). In his Philosophy of Illumination (83.24–7), Suhrawardi writes: “Light is divided into light of itself and in itself and light of itself but in another. You know that accidental light is light in another. Thus, it is not a light in itself although it is a light of itself”.

Rizvi showed how later philosophers ascribed the ontological primacy of essence (or quiddity) thesis to Suhrawardi and noted that he “clearly states that quiddity/essence in itself is a conceptual and unreal a notion as existence” (Rizvi 1999: 224), Suhrawardi noting that “the quiddity of luminosity [i.e., the same as light] is a mental universal” (PI, 92.4–5). But it is also true that Suhrawardi's “phenomenological epistemology of eidetic vision” could easily imply a primacy of essence (Rizvi 1999: 224). Suhrawardi's position, therefore, is greatly nominalist, now that both existence and essence are considered mere mental concepts, reality having been redefined with the new primacy of light. Light and essence cannot, however, be synonymous. Both light and darkness exist: “light is the being of things as their instantiating principle in concreto and not their essences” (Rizvi 1999: 224). By the same token, light is not identical with substance, since both dark substances and accidental lights exist (Walbridge 2000: 24). Rizvi (1999: 224) notes that entities grasped as essences through presential knowledge are “apparent aspects of what one might regard as ‘light monads’”, an idea whose source appears to be greatly Platonic.

For Suhrawardi, being is grasped through the (non-sensible) vision of lights that lie beyond the essences, as even the existence of bodies depends upon incorporeal lights (PI, 78.10–79.18). In his Philosophy of Illumination (79.19–22), Suhrawardi writes that “Nothing that has an essence [dhat] of which it is not unconscious is dusky, for its essence is evident to it. It cannot be a dark state in something else, since even the luminous state is not a self-subsistent light, let alone the dark state. Therefore, it is nonspatial pure incorporeal light”. Access to this ultimate reality of beings is achieved through the direct experience of its ontic light reality, rendering intuitive and non-discursive knowledge (logically) prior to any other type of knowledge. Later, Mulla Sadra (d.1640) noted Suhrawardi's confusion between the concept of existence and the reality of existence and replaced Suhrawardi's notion of light with the notion of being, blending Avicenna's ontology of contingency with Suhrawardi's Illuminationist hierarchy of lights (Rizvi 1999: 225).

4.2 Ontology of Lights

In the Niche of Lights (1998), Muhammad al-Ghazali (d.1111) discussed mystical epistemology using Qur’anic light terminology, whereas Suhrawardi, in his Philosophy of Illumination, developed a truly original light ontology. While light always remains in itself identical, its proximity or distance from the Light of Lights determines the ontic light reality of all beings. Light operates through the activities of dominion of the higher ‘triumphal’ or ‘victorial’ lights, as well as the desire of the lower lights for the higher ones, operating at all levels and hierarchies of reality (PI, 97.7–98.11). Reality proceeds from the Light of Lights and unfolds via the First Light and all the subsequent lights whose exponential interactions bring about the existence of all entities. As each new light interacts with other existing lights, more light and dark substances are generated. Light produces both immaterial and substantial lights, such as immaterial intellects (angels), human and animal souls. Light produces dusky substances, such as bodies. Light can generate both luminous accidents, such as those in immaterial lights, physical lights or rays, and dark accidents, whether it be in immaterial lights or in bodies (PI, 77.1–78.9).

Suhrawardi's metaphysics of lights rests on at least two central principles which account for all the basic classes of beings (light and darkness, substance and state, independent and dependent beings). A first principle, Walbridge notes, “is a form of the principle of sufficient reason, ‘the principle of the most noble contingency’ […] which asserts that nothing can exist without a cause of higher ontological level” (PI, 90.1–92.25). A second principle is the Aristotelian “impossibility of an ordered, actual infinity” which, with the first principle, guarantees that “there cannot be an infinite number of levels of being and that there must be one being whose existence is necessary in itself—Avicenna's ‘Necessary of Existence’ (wajib al-wujud)”, the Light of Lights (Walbridge 2000: 24–5; PI, 87.1–89.8).

With the notion of intensity of light, Suhrawardi then develops his two-fold process of light production. A vertical and a horizontal hierarchy of pure immaterial lights structure his Illuminationist metaphysics. From the Light of Lights proceeds a first vertical hierarchy of lights: from the Light of Lights proceeds a First Light (following the classical principle that from the one only the one proceeds) from which proceeds a Second Light and the all-encompassing barzakh (i.e., a ethereal body), from the second a Third Light and the Second barzakh, or the Sphere of Fixed Stars, and so forth. The first vertical hierarchy of lights mirrors the Avicennan Peripatetic process of emanation of Intelligences. Suhrawardi, however, increases the number of active principles, something that Averroes denounced in Avicenna's Neoplatonic ontology. Suhrawardi's ‘triumphal’ or ‘victorial’ lights are now as numerous as there are stars in the fixed heavens. While no longer limited to the ten Peripatetic Intelligences and now indefinite in number, they are not infinite (PI, 99.20–100.19).

The vertical hierarchy of lights interacts with a horizontal hierarchy of lights. This second hierarchy of ‘ruling’ lights incorporates, amongst other things, ancient angelologies (Semitic angelic hierarchies and Zoroastrian mythology) and some type of Platonic Forms. Each of these horizontal lights becomes a ‘Lord of Species’, i.e., a luminous self-subsisting and fixed species, whose function is analogous to the Platonic Forms in so far as it ‘governs’ the species under it (rather than being a mere universal), such as the species of bodies that move the celestial spheres and all matters sublunar, including human souls. Out of the interaction of the vertical and the horizontal lights, the bodies of the lower world are generated. These horizontal or vertical lights are all structurally interrelated through the principle of love that the lower lights have for the higher lights and the principle of domination that the higher lights have over the lower ones (PI, 101.12–103.31). The two dimensional hierarchy of lights introduces a new non linear notion of metaphysical causation.

The multiplication of metaphysical entities serves to increase the ontological distance that exists between the Light of Lights and the sublunar world, while simultaneously providing a greater holistic view of reality, since light lies at its core. Notions of intensity and gradation of light, together with notions of presence and self-manifestation, are thus central to Suhrawardi's metaphysics. The intensity of light corresponds to the degree of their self-awareness, such that the self-awareness of the Light of Lights encompasses all of reality (in terms of intensity). Later, Mulla Sadra (d.1640) takes up Suhrawardi's insight about the gradation and intensity of light and develops an ontology based on the gradation of existence (rather than light) of all beings, somehow reversing Suhrawardi's ontology with his primacy of existence and his understanding of essence as a mental concept.

4.3 Imaginal World

About half a century earlier than Ibn ‘Arabi (d.1240), Suhrawardi introduced his own independent ‘imaginal world’, what Corbin has called the mundus imaginalis, a fourth ‘imaginal’ world, alongside the intelligible, the spiritual and the material. This imaginal world, a substance made of shadows, operates like an ‘isthmus’ or an intermediary realm between the world of pure light and the physical world of darkness, lying somewhere between this physical world and the world of the species and of Platonic Forms (the horizontal lights), perhaps at the lower threshold of the world of souls.

In the imaginal world, entities somehow possess an existence of their own (some, prior to their coming into existence in this world). The imaginal world contains images that are not embedded in matter, a plane of “ghosts, of the forms in mirrors, dreams, and worlds of wonder beyond our own” which light can existentiate (Walbridge 2000: 26). The imaginal world provides the material for the miraculous. It is where the ‘metahistorical’ (Corbin's term) visions of Imams occur, where eschatological forms and images will perhaps be existentiated for the souls of the deceased, so that they may continue to perfect their souls (PI, 148.29–150.17), as well as where elements not fitting conveniently into the Aristotelian scheme of forms in matter are found. Suhrawardi did not, however, systematically develop the concept. This was left to his followers.

5. Politics and Ethics

Suhrawardi's Philosophy of Illumination carries a political dimension. Ziai (1992) provides an overview of what he calls the ‘Illuminationist political doctrine’ which establishes a connection between political authority, just rule, and the ruler's access to divine light. This is particularly manifest in the Tablets Dedicated to ‘Imad al-Din (Suhrawardi 1993c: 184.12–188.4) and the Book of Radiance (Suhrawardi 1998: 84–5), where Suhrawardi appeals to ancient Persian notions of royal glory (kharrah) and of luminous divine light (farrah), two signs of the divine authority of ancient kings of Iranian mythology, the divine lights that instructed Kay Khusraw and Zarathustra (PI, 156.3–157.3).

Suhrawardi may, in fact, appeal to a somewhat ‘mythological’ genealogy of the transmission of ancient Illuminationist philosophies from the Greek/West and the Iranian/East which he claims to revive. Ziai speculates that Suhrawardi tried to put into practice the political dimension of his Illuminationist philosophy (Ziai 1992: 337; cf. Walbridge 2000: 201–10), based mainly on passages from Suhrawardi's works and the possible circumstances of his demise and execution. Historical data supporting the thesis, Suhrawardi's relationship with his many patrons and the purpose of passages relating to these Illuminationist political doctrines need further examination.

The ethics underlying Suhrawardi's Illuminationist system has yet to be adequately investigated, but the political doctrines can provide indications of the conditions that would guarantee the reign of a just rule, thus providing some elements of an Illuminationist political ethic. Suhrawardi's particularly Platonic understanding of the mystic qua ruler and his political role, coupled with the role of intuitive or ‘mystical’ access to the ‘divine’ lights by prophets, mystics and sages might, however, not leave Suhrawardi immune to the same criticism Popper leveled against Plato.

One needs to turn to Suhrawardi's eschatology and his discussions on the fate of the soul in the afterlife to obtain a glimpse of what might constitute a ‘good’ and ethical life in this world. In line with Avicenna's classification of souls in the hereafter according to their worldly acquisition of practical and theoretical knowledge, the moral qualities developed in this life determine the fate of souls in the afterlife (PI, 148.27–150.17). In search of felicity, souls must attempt to detach themselves from their tenebrous bodies and all that is worldly and material and to access the world of immaterial lights. Souls engrossed in matter in this life partially determine their fate in the afterlife and Suhrawardi, in this respect, does not depart greatly from Peripatetic eschatology.

Prophets, saints and exceptionally gifted mystics are able to achieve conjunction with the world of pure lights. Ascetic practices in this life become a means to attain self-consciousness of the ontic luminosity of the soul. Some of Suhrawardi's allegorical and mystical treatises, such as The Treatise of the Bird, A Tale of Occidental Exile or A Day with a Group of Sufis (Suhrawardi 1982; cf. Landolt 1987), provide examples of the pedagogical role and instruction of the guide figure, of the Lord of the human species, or of spiritual entities to the novice in his or her quest for the immaterial world of lights in which salvation lies. The posthumous life of individual souls and their ability to perceive the promised other-worldly rewards and punishments become conditions for divine retribution.

6. Legacy of the Illuminationist Tradition

6.1 Post-Suhrawadian Traditions

The tragic end of Suhrawardi marked the birth of the Illuminationist tradition. By the end of the 13th century, at least two of Suhrawardi's works were readily available and studied in the major centers of learning of Syria (Damascus and Aleppo), Iraq (Baghdad) and Iran (Maraghah), some of which circulated most probably even before his death. Ziai (2003: 473–87) identifies at least two trends within the Illuminationist tradition of the 13th century that were to shape later developments: Ibn Kammuna (d.1284), on the one hand, emphasized the purely discursive and the more systematically philosophical aspects of Suhrawardi's Illuminationist philosophy, while Shahrazuri, on the other hand, focused and expanded on the symbolic and the allegorical aspects of the tradition. Ibn Kammuna, a Jewish philosopher greatly influenced by both Avicenna and Suhrawardi is the first commentator (Langermann 2005: 297–301; Pourjavady and Schmidtke 2006: 23–32). While in Baghdad, Ibn Kammuna (2003) wrote his commentary on the physics and the psychology of Suhrawardi's Intimations (in 1268). Having resided in Aleppo, Ibn Kammuna could well be, with such works as his al-Kashif (al-Jadid fi al-Hikma) completed in 1278, the link between Suhrawardi and Shahrazuri (d.ca.1288) who wrote the earliest commentary on the Philosophy of Illumination (Shahrazuri 1993; cf. Marcotte 2002) and whose encyclopedic The Divine Tree (Shahrazuri, 2004 and 2005 [a better edition]; Marcotte 2001b) and his Book of Symbols (Privot 2004) can readily be labeled Illuminationist works, although much work is needed to determine the extent of Shahrazuri's contribution to the Illuminationist tradition. In 1295, Qutb al-Din Shirazi wrote his own commentary on the Philosophy of Illumination (Shirazi 2001; Suhrawardi 1986), based on Shahrazuri's work (Walbridge 1992).

Authors that incorporated Illuminationist ideas include Muhammad Ibn Rizi (fl.ca.1280), in his Life of Souls (Marcotte 2004); Athir al-Din al-Abhari (d.1242) in his Uncovering of the Realities; Ibn Abi Jumhur Ahsa’i (d.1501) (Schmidtke 2000); the two theologians Jalal al-Din Dawwani (d.1501) and Ghiyath al-Din Dashtaki (d.1541) who both wrote commentaries on Suhrawardi's Temples of light (Dawwani 1953; Dashtaki 2003; Suhrawardi 1996); and Mir Damad (d.1631), especially in his Spiritual Attractions (2001) and his Embers (1977). Mulla Sadra (Sadr al-Din al-Shirazi) (d.1640) was most interested in Suhrawardi's critique of Avicennan Peripateticism (existence as a being of reason, the Platonic Forms, and knowledge by presence) and wrote marginal glosses on Qutb al-Din al-Shirazi's commentary on the Philosophy of Illumination (Mulla Sadra, 2010; cf. with Suhrawardi 1986). Mulla Sadra positioned himself in opposition to what he understood to be Suhrawardi's view that quiddity was primary, a view shared by Mir Damad (d.1631), and instead held, such as Hadi Sabzawari (d.1873) after him, that existence was primary.

During the same period, Suhrawardi's works entered the Turkish Ottoman and Persian Indian philosophical traditions. In the Ottoman world, Isma‘il Ankaravi (d.1631), a member of the Mevlevi Sufi order, translated and commented Suhrawardi Temples of Light (Kuspinar 1996). In the 17th century, the enigmatic Ahmad Ibn al-Harawi (probably from Herat) living in the Indian subcontinent, translated into Persian the Philosophy of Illumination on which he wrote a commentary (Harawi 1979). Azar Kayvan (d.ca.1615), a Zoroastrian high priest from Fars who emigrated to Gujurat in Mughal India during the reign of Emperor Akbar (ruled 1556–1605), started a Zoroastrian Illuminationist school (Walbridge 2001: 91–3). Even thinkers of the twentieth century, such as Muhammad Kazim ‘Assar, have been influenced by the Illuminationist tradition (Ziai 2003: 472). Cataloguing and making accessible hundreds of philosophical works in Arabic and Persian from the 12th-19th century, such as the recent publication of the Persian work of Shihab al-Din Kumijani (d.1895), the Nur al-Fu'ad, or the Inner Light, are bound to shed new light on the legacy of Suhrawardi's works. On the whole, however, almost nothing has been written on the history of the philosophical legacy of Suhrawardi's Philosophy of Illumination.

6.2 Historiography

Historiography of the Illuminationist tradition has been dominated by two main schools of thought. The first, older and more prevalent school, views Suhrawardi as the founder of a mystical, esoteric and ‘theosophical’ tradition. Its roots are found in Corbin's mystical or ‘theosophical’ paradigm (Gutas 2002: 16–9). The adoption of an ‘esoteric’ wisdom or ‘theosophy’ (Corbin), or even a philosophia perennis approach (Nasr), to Suhrawardi's work often overemphasizes the mystical at the expense of the philosophical and somehow blurs the distinction between philosophy, theology and mysticism. Proponents of this approach highlight Suhrawardi's aim to expound on Avicenna's incomplete project to develop an ‘Eastern’ (not ‘illuminative’) philosophy of Khurasan (mashriqiyya), in spite of the fact that Avicenna's ‘Eastern’ philosophy was not a mystical enterprise, but merely a philosophical tradition distinct from the one of the school of Baghdad (Gutas 2000). More generally, the proponents of the mystical approach interpret Illuminationist philosophy as a break or a departure from Avicennan Peripateticism (Mehdi H. Yazdi, Hossein Nasr, Ashtiyani), rather than seeing it as its extension and critique. Scholars have often overlooked the fact that Suhrawardi's major works are largely devoted to technical philosophical questions, of which his allegorical or minor works are not devoid.

Some, such as Fakhry (1982), have gone so far as to question the originality of Suhrawardi's Philosophy of Illumination, deeming it a mere transposition of Avicennan philosophy into a light terminology. Izutsu (1971) was one of the first to explore the analytical aspect of Suhrawardi's work, followed especially by Ziai (1990), but also by Walbridge (2000, 2001) who have focused on some of the analytical and philosophical elements of Suhrawardi's Philosophy of Illumination. While some, such as Henry Corbin and Mohammad Mo’in, have viewed Suhrawardi as the reviver of some ancient form of Persian philosophy, others, such as Ziai (2003: 443), are more skeptical and note the absence of textual evidence for such an independent Persian philosophical tradition. Similarly, Gutas (2003) notes the absence of textual evidence to support the claim that Suhrawardi attempted to revive ancient Western Greek, Gnostic and Hermetic traditions. Research should perhaps focus on the reasons why Suhrawardi appealed to the authority of the ‘Ancients’, East and West, rather than on trying to find ‘real’ historical filiations to sources to which Suhrawardi might have had access.

More studies are needed on the works of authors who belonged to, or who were influenced by the Illuminationist tradition (see e.g., Schmidtke 2000; Pourjavadi & Schmidtke 2006). This will provide the much needed accounts of the complex historical and philosophical developments of the Illuminationist tradition. Although recent scholarship highlights Suhrawardi's critique of Avicennan Peripatetic logic, epistemology and metaphysics (Ziai 1990) and even psychology, more studies are needed that explore specific logical, epistemological, physical, and metaphysical issues found in Suhrawardi's four major Arabic texts and that compare systematically Suhrawardi's Philosophy of Illumination with Avicenna's major works, such as the Cure. This will undoubtedly provide new insight into Suhrawardi's greatly Platonic reworking of Avicennan Peripateticism, what Gutas (2002) has identified as Suhrawardi's Illuminationist Avicennism.

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Arabic and Islamic Philosophy, special topics in: illuminationism | Avicenna [Ibn Sina] | Ibn Kammuna | Mulla Sadra