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Kazimierz Twardowski

First published Tue Jul 6, 2010

Kazimierz Twardowski (1866–1938) was an Austrian-born Polish philosopher. He was a student of Franz Brentano and the founder of the Lvov-Warsaw School. His main work, On the Content and Object of Presentations (1894), established the need for the distinction between the content and the object of a presentation within Brentanian theories of the intentionality of mental acts. The distinction is a psychological, non-platonistic counterpart of Frege's distinction between sense and reference. Other students of Brentano, notably Edmund Husserl and Alexius Meinong, integrated the distinction between content and object in their works after the appearance of Twardowski's book. Twardowski spoke of contradictory objects before Meinong: he was the first philosopher to hold a theory of intentionality, truth, and predication in which thinking and speaking about non-existents, including contradictions, involves presenting and naming non-existents, including contradictory objects. Like Meinong, Twardowski belonged to a tradition of non-idealistic German-language philosophy that originated with Bernard Bolzano, and that influenced, via G. F. Stout, Moore and Russell's transition from idealism to analytic philosophy. After moving to Lvov in 1895, Twardowski devoted himself to establishing a tradition of scientific, i.e. rigorous and exact philosophy in Poland inspired by Brentano's views rather than to publishing his own ideas. As a result, his published oeuvre, written in Polish and German, is relatively small. Twardowski's unpublished manuscripts, often complete sets of lecture notes, constitute a considerable part of his philosophical corpus. According to Twardowski's student Roman Ingarden, assessments of Twardowski's achievements and his role in history should be considered incomplete and hypothetical as long as they are based only on his published writings (Ingarden 1948, 18). Important projects for the edition and dissemination of Twardowski's manuscript material are currently ongoing in France, Poland, Italy, and the Netherlands.[1]

Twardowski was a sharp thinker and a writer of exemplary clarity. He wrote on signs, on meaning and reference, and on indexicality and truth, defending a non-platonistic view of time-independent truth; he wrote on the metaphysics of parts and wholes, on ethics, on the history of philosophy, on the relation between philosophy and psychology, and, importantly, on metaphilosophy. In Twardowski's times psychology was divided roughly in two camps: ‘Wundtian’ experimental psychology and ‘Brentanian’ descriptive pyschology (see the entries on Wundt and Brentano); although Twardowski sided mainly with Brentano's way of looking at psychology, he lectured on themes from experimental psychology such as optical illusion and established the first laboratory of empirical psychology in Poland. He developed a judgment-based theory of knowledge, and he valued analysis as a fruitful method in philosophy. This notwithstanding, it is a widespread convinction that Twardowski's most tangible success remains his extraordinary work as educator and initiator of philosophical activities in Poland. Indeed, Twardowski was a talented teacher, like Brentano, and he exerted, through his teaching, a powerful influence on generations of young Polish philosophers, such as, next to Ingarden, Jan Łukasiewicz, Kazimierz Ajdukiewicz, Stanisław Leśniewski (who, in turn, taught Alfred Tarski) and Tadeusz Kotarbiński. This influence regarded first of all matters of method: Twardowski laid emphasis on ‘small philosophy’, namely on the detailed, systematic analysis of specific problems—including problems from the history of philosophy—characterised by rigor and clarity, rather than on the edification of whole philosophical systems and comprehensive world-views.

1. Life

Kazimierz (or Kasimir) Jerzy Skrzypna-Twardowski, Ritter von Ogończyk was born to Polish parents on October 20, 1866 in Vienna, which was then the capital of the Habsburg Empire. He attended the Theresian Academy (Theresianum), the secondary school of Vienna's bourgeoise elite. Like many other high-school students at the time, his philosophy textbook was the Philosophische Propedaeutik by Robert Zimmermann, Bolzano's ‘favorite pupil’ (Herzensjunge). The book covered empirical psychology, logic, and the introduction to philosophy.

In 1885 Twardowski enrolled at the University of Vienna and became a student of Franz Brentano, for whom he felt “the most sincere awe and veneration” and whom he remembered as “uncompromising and relentless in his quest for rigor in formulation, consistency in expression, and precision in the working out of proofs” (Twardowski 1926, 20). In addition to philosophy, Twardowski also studied history, mathematics, physics, and physiology (with Sigmund Exner, the son of Bolzano's correspondent Franz Exner). While a student, Twardowski was a close friend of Alois Höfler, Christian von Ehrenfels, Josef Klemens Kreibig, and Hans Schmidkunz—the latter initiated regular meetings between younger and older students of Brentano and founded the Vienna Philosophical Society in 1888. Twardowski defended his doctoral dissertation, Idea and Perception—An Epistemological Investigation of Descartes (published in 1892), in the Fall of 1891. Since Brentano had resigned from his chair in 1880, Twardowski's official PhD supervisor was Robert Zimmermann. In 1891–1892 Twardowski spent time as a researcher both in Leipzig, where he followed courses by Wilhelm Wundt and Oswald Külpe, and in Munich, where he attended the lectures of Carl Stumpf, another pupil of Brentano. Between 1892 and 1895 Twardowski earned a living working for an insurance company and writing for German-language and Polish-language newspapers about philosophy, literature, and music while working on his Habilitation thesis, On the Content and Object of Presentations—A Psychological Investigation (1894), and teaching as Privatdozent at the University of Vienna, where he gave courses in logic, on the immortality of the soul and a practicum on Hume's Enquiry concerning Human Understanding.

In 1895 Twardowski, then 29, was appointed as extraordinarius at the University of Lvov (then Lemberg, now Lviv, in Polish Lwów), one of the two Polish-speaking Universities of the Empire. He saw it as his duty to export Brentano's style of philosophizing to Poland and spent most of his time organizing Lvov's philosophical life. He reanimated the Lvov Philosophical Circle and gave lectures aimed at a broader public. He organized his teaching in general ‘core courses’ in logic, psychology, ethics, and the history of philosophy (given and updated every four years), and placed less emphasis on specialized courses. Further, he inaugurated a philosophical seminar and reading room, where he made his private library available to students, with whom he always maintained close and frequent personal contacts. Relatively many of Twardowski's students were women (among others, Izydora Dąmbska, Maria Lutman-Kokoszyńska, and Seweryna Łuszczewska-Romahnowa, all of whom held philosophy chairs later). At a certain point, Twardowski had managed to create three concentric circles of philosophical influence: there was the Philosophical Circle, open to all university departments, the Polish Philosophical Society (1904), open to professional philosophers, and the journal Ruch Filozoficzny, conceived as an organ of promotion of philosophy at large and open to everyone (1911). Twardowski also established a laboratory of psychology in 1907. As he writes, he was waging “a most aggressive propaganda campaign on behalf of philosophy” (Twardowski 1926, 20). The campaign soon resulted in his lectures being moved to the Great Concert Hall of the Lvov Musical Society when the number of students reached two thousand (in the mid-Twenties he lectured in the Apollo movie theater, at 7 a.m. in the summer and 8 a.m. in the winter, without academic quarter). All this amounted to the establishment of a philosophical movement that soon became known as a proper school: first, until the First World War, it was known as the Lvov School; then, when the Russian-speaking University of Warsaw again became Polish-speaking, and Twardowski's students starting getting positions and having their own students there, it was known as the Lvov-Warsaw School (see Lvov-Warsaw School). The name is somewhat inaccurate, for Twardowski's students occupied philosophy chairs in all post-war Polish universities except Lublin, not only in Lvov and Warsaw. As has often been pointed out, what all students of Twardowski had in common was not a particular set of views, but a rather distinctive attitude to philosophical problems informed by precision and clarity that they inherited from Twardowski's general conception of methodology, and which he valued most highly. According to Jordan, Twardowski led his students

to undertake painstaking analysis of specific problems which were rich in conceptual and terminological distinctions, and directed rather to the clarification than to the solution of the problems involved. (Jordan 1963, 7f)[2]

In this, Twardowski's students learned what he had learned from Brentano, namely

how to strive relentlessly after matter-of-factness, and how to pursue a method of analysis and investigation that, insofar as that is possible, guarantees that matter-of-factness. He proved to me by example that the most difficult problems can be clearly formulated, and the attempts at their solution no less clearly presented, provided one is clear within oneself. The emphasis he placed on sharp conceptual distinctions that did not lapse into fruitless nit-picking was an important guideline for my own writings. (Twardowski 1926, 20)

Twardowski was convinced that the philosophical way of thinking he advocated, namely precision in thought and writing and rigor in argumentation, was directly beneficial to practical life. It was with the idea of proving exactly this point—by way of his personal example—that he accepted to head various kinds of committees (among others, the University Lectures Series, the Society for Women in Higher Education, the Society for Teachers in High Education, the Federation of Austrian Middle-School Teacher Candidates) and to be Dean twice and Rector three times in a row (though he repeatedly refused to be Minister of Education). All these activities cost him a lot of time: in fact, Twardowski's choice to be most of all an educator and an organizer left him very little time for academic writing. Besides, as he reports, Twardowski wasn't much interested in the publication of his ideas. Thus, since he placed high demands on the clarity and the logical cogency of philosophical work, he set out to publish only when it was required by external circumstances (Twardowski 1926, 30). As a consequence, in his Lvov years, Twardowski published little. He officially retired in 1930.

Twardowski died on February 11, 1938.

On Twardowski's heritage and his achievements as an educator and organizer in Lvov, see Czeżowski 1948, Ingarden 1948, Dąmbska 1978, Woleński 1989, 1997 and 1998. With special reference to psychology, see Rzepa and Stachowski 1993.

2. The Vienna Years: 1891–1895

Twardowski's main publication in the Vienna period is, next to his doctoral dissertation Idea and Perception (1891), his Habilitationsschrift, On the Content and Object of Presentations (1894), Twardowski's most influential work. According to J. N. Findlay, Content and Object is “unquestionably one of the most interesting treatises in the whole range of modern philosophy; it is clear, concentrated, and amazingly rich in ideas” (1963, 8).

2.1 On the Content and Object of Presentations (1894): Context, Influence and Historical Background

In Content and Object, Twardowski shares a number of Brentano's fundamental theses. Five of them are particularly relevant here. According to the first and most important thesis, the essential characteristic of mental phenomena, and what demarcates them from physical phenomena, is intentionality. We can sum it up as follows:

Brentano's Thesis:
Every mental phenomenon has an object towards which it is directed.

Mental phenomena, also called mental acts, fall into three separate classes (second thesis): presentations (Vorstellungen), judgments, and phenomena of love and hate. In the mental act of presentation, an object is presented; in a judgment, judged; in love and hate, loved or hated.[3] Next (third thesis), mental phenomena are either presentations or are based on presentations. We need to present an object in order to judge it or appreciate it (though we do not need to judge or appreciate an object that we might just present). Importantly, however (fourth thesis), a judgment is not a combination of presentations, but a mental act sui generis that accepts or rejects the object given by the presentation at its basis (see Brentano's Theory of Judgment). In keeping with this idea, all judgments (fifth thesis) can be aptly expressed in the existential form ‘A is’ (positive judgment) or ‘A is not’ (negative judgment) (alternatively, ‘A exists’ or ‘A does not exist’). In both cases, the judgment has a so-called ‘immanent’ object, given by the presentation, which is simply A.

Both the notion of an object ‘immanent’ in a mental act, as well as, in all generality, the term ‘object’ in Brentano's Thesis, have an ambiguous character. Are the objects of mental acts fully inside us or not? To correctly judge that the aether does not exist means, in Brentanian terms, rejecting the aether which is given to one's consciousness by a presentation. But if the aether is an object immanent in me, fully inside my consciousness, what does it mean, then, that I reject it? Is it some mental entity inside my consciousness that I reject? But how could that possibly be correct? In this case I most certainly have something in my head, and that something exists. So it cannot be correct that I reject it—for, if that is the aether I reject, the judgment that the aether does not exist cannot be true. The aether should be a physical space-filling substance, outside my consciousness: that is what I am rejecting. But if that is what I reject, it seems something must be there for me to be able to affirm that it is not there. This is very puzzling. It was fundamentally due to difficulties of this kind that Brentano's theory of judgment was subjected, from 1889 onwards, to continuous objections by philosophers such as Sigwart and Windelband. Brentano engaged in the debate in his defense, as did his pupils Marty and Hillebrand. It is in this context that Twardowski's Habilitationsschrift was conceived. Twardowski saw that notions such as ‘the object of a presentation’ and ‘immanent object’ were ambiguous because in Brentano's writings the object of a presentation was identified with that of content of a presentation (Twardowski 1926, 10). In Content and Object, Twardowski set out to clarify exactly the relationship between the two, with far-reaching implications for Brentano's original position.

The distinction between content and object of a presentation was not new in Twardowski's time. It was the most fundamental element of Bolzano 1837; it was later present in works of Bolzanian inspiration (Zimmermann 1853, Kerry 1885–1891; on Zimmermann see Winter 1975, Morscher 1997, Raspa 1999); and it was also mentioned in works of Brentanian inspiration (Höfler and Meinong 1890, Hillebrand 1891, Marty 1884–1895: article 5, 1894). Nevertheless, the distinction was by no means common lore. In particular, before Twardowski, no Brentanian had endorsed the distinction between content and object in a way that offered a basis for solving the problems of Brentano's theory, nor had anyone among the Brentanians devoted any in-depth study to the issue, although the differences between Bolzano's and Brentano's theories are such that reworking the distinction in a Brentanian framework raises philosophical problems that are by no means trivial. A major difference concerns the role of the content of a presentation and its ontological status, since for a Brentanian the content of a presentation can only be something actually existing in one's mind. No Brentanian had thus realised in full the implications that reinterpreting the Bolzanian distinction in a Brentanian key would have. Carrying out this task, and thus helping Brentano's theory out of its most pressing troubles, was Twardowski's original contribution. He drew inspiration from arguments in favor of the content-object distinction present in Bolzano, but he reinterpreted them in a Brentanian framework to sustain conclusions that were opposite to Bolzano's and that were new for the Brentanians. One such conclusion, and a major implication of Twardowski's theory of intentionality, is that there are no objectless presentations, presentations without an object, no matter how strange and improbable that object is[4]. Even presentations of contradictory objects have both content and object. It is this thesis and the conclusions that Twardowski drew from it that have had a major impact on the development of Brentanian theories of intentionality and that opened the way to ontologies as rich as that of Alexius Meinong. On the other hand, this position, together with Twardowski's identification of meaning with psychological content, prompted Husserl's critical reactions and led Husserl to the theory of intentionality set out in the Logical Investigations (1900/01) where Twardowski's distinction between content and object is taken up (on this, see Schuhmann 1993; on Twardowski's influence and ‘triggering effect’ on Husserl, see Cavallin 1990, especially 28f). Twardowski's ideas were not only influential on the continent. Via G. F. Stout, who published an anonymous review of Content and Object, in Mind, Twardowski's ideas had an influence on Moore and Russell's transition from idealism to analytic philosophy (van der Schaar 1996).

2.2 ‘The Presented’

The aim of Content and Object is to distinguish “the presented, in one sense, where it means the content, from the presented in the other sense, where it is used to designate the object” (Twardowski 1894, 4). Its main thesis is that in every mental act a content (Inhalt) and an object (Gegenstand) must be distinguished. This distinction enables Twardowski to clarify that

Twardowski's Thesis:
Every mental phenomenon has a content and an object, and it is directed towards its object, not towards its content.

On the basis of the distinction between content and object, Twardowski is in turn able to clarify Brentano's notion of ‘object immanent (immanentes Objekt) in a presentation’ by identifying it with the notion of content, and to clarify Brentano's notion of ‘object of a presentation’ by identifying it with the notion of object.

The distinction between the content and the object of a presentation rests on a psychological or epistemic difference which is, roughly speaking, the mental counterpart of Frege's distinction between sense and reference. The object of a presentation, says Twardowski using Zimmermann's terminology, is that which is presented in a presentation; the content is that through which the object is presented. An important argument Twardowski gives in favor of this distinction—and which strengthens the analogy with Frege's distinction—is that we can present the same object in two different ways by having two presentations with the same object but with different content. Twardowski calls such presentations interchangeable presentations (Wechselvorstellungen). The presentation of the Roman Juvavum and the presentation of the birthplace of Mozart have the same object, Salzburg; however, their content differs. To offer a rough analogy, think of an arrow pointing at an object: the object is what the arrow is pointing at, the content is what in the arrow makes it the arrow it is, that is, its being directed to that object and not to another. The act is just the ‘being directed towards’ of the arrow. Interchangeable presentations are like two arrows pointing at the same object.

Twardowski thinks of the difference between act, content, and object in the following way. An act of presentation is a mental event which takes place in our mind at a certain time. The content is literally inside the mind, and exists dependently on the act, as long as the act does. The object is instead independent of the mental act (1894, 1, 4; §7, 36), and, generally speaking, not inside one's mind, although in some special cases the object of a presentation might be a mental item. This special case is the case in which the content of some presentation plays the role of the object of another presentation. This is not infrequent, because any time we discuss the content of a presentation, describing its characteristics and its relations to other things, we are presenting it. And for this to be possible, the content must play the role of object in the presentation(s) we are having (what we would call second-order presentations). To use the arrow metaphor once again, second-order presentations, then, are like an arrow directed towards another arrow.

The way in which Twardowski relates mind and language makes the distinction between content and object fairly easy to understand. Names are the linguistic counterpart of presentations. By ‘names’ Twardowski means the categorematic terms of traditional logic (‘Barack Obama,’ ‘The President of the United States,’ ‘black,’ ‘man,’‘he’). A name has three functions: first, a name makes known that in the mind of the person using the name an act of presentation is taking place; secondly, a name means something; thirdly, it names an object. Twardowski takes the meaning of a name to be the content of the presentation that, as the name makes known, is taking place in the speaker (§3), that is, Twardowski takes meaning to be something mental and individual. This holds, mutatis mutandis, also for judgments. In this sense, in Content and Object the semantic sphere is dependent on the mental sphere. This trait qualifies Twardowski's position as psychologistic (see Psychologism: PA3). Although his position on meaning underwent a development, Twardowski never adhered to a platonistic conception of meaning like Bolzano or Frege did.

If all this is intuitive, why are the object and the content of a presentation conflated? Twardowski maintains that the reason why content and object are often identified comes, among others, from a linguistic ambiguity: both the content and the object are said to be ‘presented’ in a presentation (§4). Twardowski offers an analysis of the ambiguity of the term ‘presented’ by appealing to the linguistic distinction between modifying and attributive (or determining) adjectives, and he illustrates it with an analogy between the act of presenting an object and the act of painting a landscape. When a painter paints a landscape, she also paints a painting: so we can say that the painting and the landscape are both painted. But in this situation ‘painted landscape’ can have two very different meanings. In the first meaning of ‘painted’, a painted landscape is a landscape; in the second meaning of ‘painted’ a painted landscape is not a landscape, but a painting (like in Magritte's La trahison des images (1928–9): it is a painted pipe we are looking at, not a pipe). In the first case, ‘painted’ is used in an attributive sense (the landscape is a portion of nature that happens to be painted by a painter in a painting); in the second case ‘painted’ is used in a modifying sense (that in which, looking at the painting in a museum, someone may say: this is a landscape!). The painted landscape in the modifying sense is a painting, and thus identical with the painting painted in the attributive sense. Analogously, in an act of presentation, the object can be, like the painted landscape, said to be ‘presented’ in two senses. The object presented in the modifying sense is identical with the content presented in the attributive sense: it is dependent on the act of presentation, and it is what we mean by ‘the object immanent in the act’; the object presented in the attributive sense is the object of the presentation, what happens to be presented in a presentation, and what is independent of the act of presentation.

2.3 Nonexistent Objects

According to a Brentanian conception of judgment, when we judge, the object is given to us by an act of presentation. Given this fact, Twardowski's analysis of ‘presented’ in terms of modifying vs. attributive adjectives is fundamental to understand what is exactly ‘judged in a judgment.’ For it is not only in presentations that we can distinguish act, content and object, but also in judgments. When we pass a judgment, we either accept or reject an object through a content. All judgments have a form which can be linguistically expressed as ‘The object A exists’ or ‘The object A does not exist.’ The object of judgment (A) is what is judged in a judgment. This object is the object of the presentation at the basis of the judgment, it is not the content of the presentation; it is the object presented in the attributive sense, not in the modifying sense. The content of a judgment is the existence or non-existence of the object presented. It might seem strange at first to hear Twardowski say that the content of a judgment is the (non-)existence of the object, but Twardowski has something like the following in mind: we judge about the object A that it exists (or that it does not exist). Twardowski's analysis clarifies what is going on when we judge, in a Brentanian theory of judgment, that the aether does not exist. Judging that the aether does not exist means rejecting a physical space-filling substance outside my consciousness. The object of this judgment is not mental. However, this does not mean that there is nothing inside my consciousness: there is a mental content, through which the aether is presented and judged as non-existing. That content, present in me, however, exists; it is the aether itself that does not exist.

For a theory of judgment like the one sketched above to work, the object we judge must be the very object we present. Therefore, Twardowski's thesis must be understood in the strong sense that there are no presentations which do not have an object: if a presentation did not have an object, we would not have an object to judge as existing or non-existing. It is for this reason that a crucial part of Content and Object is devoted to defending this claim, and to showing that, despite appearances, every presentation has an object (§5). This is like saying, coming back to our arrow metaphor, that every arrow points at something. Twardowski's strategy is to show that presentations which are normally deemed by others to be objectless—i.e., arrows that do not point to anything—are not such. There exist no presentations without an object: there are presentations whose object does not exist. Twardowski gives a number of arguments for his position. Of all these arguments, the key one is an argument based on the three functions of names in language.

If someone uses the expression: ‘oblique square,’ then he makes known that there occurs in him an act of presentation. The content, which belongs to this act, constitutes the meaning of this name. But this name does not only mean something, it also designates something, namely, something which combines in itself contradictory properties and whose existence one denies as soon as one feels inclined to make a judgment about it. Something is undoubtedly designated by the name, even though this something does not exist. (§5, 23)

On the basis of this reasoning and a linguistic analysis of how ‘nothing’ functions in language Twardowski rejects Bolzano's claim that ‘nothing’ is an objectless presentation by showing that ‘nothing’ is a syncategorematic expression (like ‘and,’ ‘or,’ and ‘the’) not a categorematic one. If an expression is not a categorematic expression, it is not a name; but if an expression is not a name, it does not need to have three functions. To every name there corresponds a presentation and vice versa; if an expression is not a name, then there is no presentation corresponding to it. If there is no presentation corresponding to ‘nothing’ because ‘nothing’ is not a name, the question of its object does not arise. This argument has been said to anticipate by 37 years Carnap's analysis of Heidegger's ‘The nothing itself nothings.’ (Woleński 1998, 11). The comparison should however not make one think that Twardowski shared Carnap's attitude towards metaphysics (see 2.4 below.)

Another argument given by Twardowski for the thesis that every presentation has an object is based on the different ontological status of act, content, and object of a presentation. The act and the content always exist; and, in fact, they always exist together, forming a whole in the mind, a unified mental reality, though the content has a dependent existence on the act.[5] The object may or may not exist. Suppose you have the following presentations: the presentation of Barack Obama, that of a possible object such as the aether, and that of an impossible object, such as a dodecahedron with thirteen sides or a round square. The objects of these presentations (namely Barack Obama, the aether, and the round square) differ greatly, but they are still all objects. Barack Obama is an existing object; the aether and the dodecahedron with thirteen sides are non-existing objects. When we present an object such as a dodecahedron with thirteen sides or a round square, the object, that which is named, is different from the content because the content exists and the object does not. It is the object, not the content, that is rejected in the negative existential judgment ‘the round square does not exist,’ for it is the object that does not exist; the content ‘exists in the truest sense of the word’ (§5, 24).

A third argument rests on the difference between being presented and existing (§5, 24). Those who claim that there are objectless presentations, says Twardowski, confuse ‘being presented’ with ‘existing.’ To reinforce his point, Twardowski offers several observations, among others, one resting on the claim that it is the object which is the bearer of contradictory properties, not the content. This claim will be described later by Meinong and Mally as the principle of the independence of Being (existence) from Being-So (bearing properties). When we present an object which does not exist because it is contradictory, i.e. impossible, we need not immediately notice that that object has contradictory qualities: it is possible that we discover this successively by further reasoning. Suppose now that only presentations with possible objects are accepted. Then, Twardowski continues, the presentation of something contradictory would have an object for as long as we did not notice the contradiction; the moment we discovered it, the presentation would cease to have an object. What would then bear the contradictory qualities? Since the content can't be what bears the contradictory qualities, it is the object itself that bears them; but then, this object has to be what is presented.[6]

The arguments above ultimately rest on the idea that every name has three functions. This assumption can also be seen, in turn, as resting on an even more basic idea, namely that in all generality ‘object’ equals ‘being capable to take up the role of object in a presentation,’ thus an object is anything that can be presented; and anything that can be named by a name (§3, 12; §5, 23; §7, 37). Yet, saying that an object is anything that can be named by a name and that a name always has the function of naming are two sides of the same coin, as are the claim that an object is anything that can be presented by a presentation and the claim that a presentation always has an object. This cluster of correlative assumptions is the core of the theory. Only when this core is accepted can the other claims put forward by Twardowski (namely (1) that ‘being presented’ is not the same as ‘existing’ and (2) that objects can possess properties even though they do not exist) become convincing parts of a cogent theory of intentionality. One might note, however, that it is a theory for which there are no non-circular arguments, for the theory is acceptable only to those who are already convinced that there are no empty names, that all categorematic terms, including ‘round square,’ ‘aether,’, ‘Pegasus,’ etc. have the function of naming something, not only the function of being meaningful.

As is known, the theory, in Meinong's version, will be the critical target of Russell's ‘On Denoting’ (1905).

2.4 Mereology: Parts of the Content and Parts of the Object

Metaphysics is importantly present in Content and Object, and particularly important are the mereological considerations Twardowski offers. According to Ingarden, Content and Object offered “the first consistently constructed theory of objects manifesting a certain theoretical unity since the times of scholasticism and of the ‘ontology’ of Christian Wolff” (1948, 258). One cannot literally agree with Ingarden considering the Leibnizian metaphysics in Bolzano's Athanasia (1827)—hidden in the two-thousand pages of the Wissenschaftslehre—and Brentano's work in mereology. Nevertheless, if the impact of Content and Object is compared with that of Bolzano's or Brentano's metaphysics, things are different. Content and Object was a fundamental contribution to the renaissance of Aristotelian metaphysics—metaphysics in the sense of a general theory of objects—which led to both Meinong's theory of objects and to Husserl's formal ontology of parts and wholes in the Third Logical Investigation. The story continues, later, with Leśniewski's mereology and Ingarden's ontology. The heritage of Content and Object also includes the fact that Twardowski's pupils had a relation to metaphysics which was vastly different from the approach that was typical, for instance, of the Vienna circle (see Łukasiewicz 1936). In Poland, metaphysics was not rejected as nonsense, but accepted as a respectable area of investigation to be explored using rigorous methods, including axiomatics (see Smith 1988, 315–6)

Like anyone in pre-set theoretical times, Twardowski has a very broad notion of (proper) part, covering much more than just the pieces of an object. Twardowski distinguishes material and formal parts of an object. The material parts of an object comprise not only the pieces of an object, but also anything that can be said to be a component of it, such as the series 1, 3, 5 is composed of three numbers (namely, 1, 3, and 5). Among the material parts of an object are also its qualities (Beschaffenheiten) such as extension, weight, color, etc. (1894, §10, 58). The formal parts of an object are the relations (Beziehungen) obtaining between the object and its material parts (primary formal parts) as well as the relations obtaining among the material parts themselves (secondary formal parts) (1894, §9, 48 and ff.; §10, 51 and ff.).

In keeping with the tradition, Twardowski calls the matter of an object the sum of its material parts and the form of an object the sum of its formal parts. A special kind of primary formal parts are (relations of) properties (Eigenschaften): these are relations between an object as a whole and one of its material parts, consisting in the whole's having the part at issue (1894, §10, 56). Since Twardowski accepts that among the parts of an object there are the relations in which that object is in, Twardowski's mereology is, strictly speaking, an atomless mereology: there are no simples (1894, §12, 74). However, we can speak of atoms if we restrict ourselves to material parts only (for instance, in the case of the number one, we can say it is a simple object only if we consider the (proper) material parts it has, namely zero).

The distinction between content and object enables Twardowski to clearly distinguish conceptualizations regarding parts of the object from conceptualizations regarding the parts of the content (as special cases of objects). This, in turn, enables Twardowski to offer sophisticated considerations, leading him among others to fix clearly the notion of the characteristic mark (Merkmal, nota) of an object. Twardowski calls elements the parts of the content of a presentation; he calls characteristic marks the parts of the object of a presentation (§8, 46–7); the characteristic marks of the object are presented through the elements of the content. The content of a presentation is the collection of the presentations of the characteristic marks of the object of the presentation. The notion of characteristic mark is a relative one because only the parts of an object that happen to be actually presented in the content of a presentation in someone's mind qualify as its characteristics.

For example, one can be presented with a table without thinking of the shape of its legs; in this case, the shape of the table legs is a (material, metaphysical) constituent (of second order), but not a characteristic of the table. But if one thinks, while being presented with the table, of the shape of its legs, then the shape had to be considered a characteristic of the table. (§13, 86; Eng. transl. 81).

According to Twardowski, it is not possible to present all the parts of an object in a presentation. Given that the number of parts of an object is boundless, and that we can only present a finite amount of characteristics, the number of the elements of the content is therefore lower than that of the parts of the object (§12, 78–9; on this point Twardowski is again indebted to Bolzano (Wissenschaftslehre, §64). It follows that no adequate presentation is possible of any object (§13, 83).

Like Brentano had done, Twardowski distinguishes, with respect to material parts, metaphysical from physical and logical parts on the basis of a notion of dependence and separability.[7] However, differently from Brentano, Twardowski does not construe the notion of dependence in terms of existence of the objects involved. His notion of dependence needs also to be applicable to non-existing objects. Consequently, Twardowski construes the notion of dependence of the parts of an object in terms of modes of presentability of the parts of an object, i.e. as existence of the parts of the content of a presentation (which always exists). The inseparability of a part p1 from a part p2 of an object O is not construed in the sense that it is not possible for p1 to exist without p2 existing, but in the sense that in the content of the presentation of an object O the part that represents p1 cannot exist without the part that represents p2 existing, that is, both must be elements of the content of the presentation of the object O.

Two material parts of the content of a presentation of A and of B are mutually separable iff A can be presented without presenting B and vice versa. Mutually separable parts are physical parts. For instance, the parts of the content of the presentations of the pages and the cover of a book are mutually separable.

Two material parts of the content of a presentation of A and of B are one-sidedly separable iff A can be presented without B, but not vice versa. Logical parts are one-sidedly separable: for instance, we can have a presentation of color without the presentation of red, but not vice versa.

Two material parts of the content of a presentation of A and of B are mutually inseparable (but yet distinguishable) iff they are neither mutually nor one-sidedly separable. Metaphysical parts are mutually inseparable, e.g. you cannot present separately the being colored and the being extended of something colored and extended, although those parts are in abstracto distinguishable in the object.

On Twardowski's mereology see Cavallin (1990) and Rosiak (1998).

2.5 The Position of Content and Object in Twardowski's Oeuvre

Content and Object should be seen as part of a bigger research aim that Twardowski had set for himself. This included developing a theory of concepts and a theory of judgment.

In Content and Object, Twardowski had given a coherent account of how judgments such as ‘The aether does not exist’ work on the basis of the systematization of the notion of ‘object of a presentation.’ That systematization however had implications for the theory of judgment which went far beyond the account of judgments such as ‘The aether does not exist.’ Although Content and Object contains little on the theory of judgment, Twardowski was well aware of those implications. A letter to Meinong is evidence that Twardowski was developing a theory of judgment which continued the work initiated by Content and Object, whose first main outline can be found in Twardowski's manuscripts Logik 1894/5 and Logika 1895/6 (Betti & van der Schaar 2004, Betti 2005).

In his ‘Self-Portrait’ Twardowski also remarks that it was the question of the nature of concepts that brought him to Content and Object. The issue ensued from Twardowski's research on a particular concept in his doctoral dissertation, Descartes' concept of clear and distinct perception. Since concepts are a species of presentations, Twardowski saw that he had first to investigate presentations in general, and thus to dispel the ambiguities that the notion of ‘the presented’ carried with itself (Twardowski 1926, 10). Work on concepts is to be found in the manuscript Logik 1894/5, where concepts are defined as presentations with well-defined content, in Intuitions and Concepts (1898) and in The Essence of Concepts (1924), where presentations with well-defined content (i.e. fixed by a definition) are called ‘logical concepts.’ An important role in Twardowski's theory of concepts and definitions is played by the notion of presented judgment, i.e. judgments not really passed, but merely presented (in the modified sense). Twardowski's investigation of the notion of (logical) concept is important to understand his attitude towards objectivity and unicity of meaning, i.e. his relationship to psychologism on the one hand, and the role of the theorizations in Content and Object of two notions: that of the object of a general presentation (which disappears for instance in Logik 1894/5) and that of indirect presentations on the other hand.

3. The Lvov Years: 1895–1938

Among the issues that Twardowski only sketched or left open in his Vienna years and investigated later are, next to theories of truth and knowledge (Theory of Knowledge, 1925), the relationship between time and truth (‘On the So-called Relative Truths,’ 1900) and that between linguistic meaning and the content of mental acts (‘Actions and Products,’ 1912), and the relationship between a priori or deductive sciences, a posteriori or inductive sciences and the notion of grounding (‘A Priori and A Posteriori Sciences,’ 1923). Well worth mentioning are his writings on issues of philosophical methodology (‘On Clear and Obscure Philosophical Style,’ 1919/20; ‘Symbolomania and Pragmatophobia,’ 1921). He also left a relatively substantial corpus of writings in ethics.

Twardowski's publications during his Lvov years are in Polish, but of those writings that Twardowski considered as important academic publications we normally also have German versions. Especially important and influential among these are ‘On the So-Called Relative Truths’ (1900) and ‘Actions and Products’ (1912).

3.1 On the so-called relative truths (1900)

‘On the So-Called Relative Truths’ (henceforth: Relative Truths) is a work of fundamental importance for the development of the idea of absolute truth in Poland. Scholars have deemed its impact to have reached as far as Tarski's work on truth (Wolenski & Simons 1989). It certainly influenced the 1910–1913 discussion on future contingents which involved Kotarbiński, Leśniewski, and Łukasiewicz, which served later as metaphysical foundation for Łukasiewicz's three-valued logic (Woleński 1990). Twardowski's position is distinctive and interesting because it is a non-platonistic theory of absolute truth, though it is difficult to say exactly what place it occupies with respect to Leśniewski's nominalistic or to Tarski's platonistic approach (for these labels see Simons 2003: section 2.) One of the reasons why it was important for Twardowski to defend an anti-relativistic notion of truth was that relativism jeopardizes the possibility of constructing ethics as a science based on principles (on Twardowski's ethics, see Paczkowska-Łagowska 1977). This aspect is important because Twardowski is usually characterized not as a builder of systems, but as championing ‘small philosophy.’ This is correct, in some sense, but it should not make one mistakenly think that there is no unity sought in Twardowski's thought, or that his works are separate small occasional contributions without overarching ideas in the background governing their development.

In Relative Truths, Twardowski opposes Brentano's ideas on the relationship between time and truth, and sides instead with Bolzano's views.[8] By ‘truth,’ Twardowski means a true judgment and by ‘absolute truth’ he means a judgment true independently of any circumstance, time, and place.

The main claim of Relative Truths is that every truth (falsity) is absolute, i.e. no judgment changes its truth-value relatively to circumstance, time, or place. Although Twardowski's treatment is general, and is not confined to the relation between truth and time, it is his ideas on the latter that were particularly important for later discussions. We can characterize Twardowski's view in this respect as the view that a judgment is true for ever and since ever, that is:

Omnitemporal truth:
For any judgment g, if g is true at a time t, then it is true also at an arbitrary time t′ past or future with respect to t (the same applies, mutatis mutandis, to falsity).

Twardowski's aim is to defend this claim against those who argue that truth is relative on the basis of examples of elliptical sentences (such as ‘I don't’), sentences with indexicals (‘my father is called Vincent’), sentences of general form (‘radioactivity is good for you’), and sentences about ethical principles (‘it is wrong to speak against one's own convictions’). Those who argue that truth is relative on this basis, says Twardowski, make a mistake. They confuse judgments, which are the real truth-bearers, with the (type) sentences expressing them. But sentences are merely the external expression of judgments, and often they do not express everything one has in mind when judging. For human speech has a purely practical task; it can perfectly serve its communicative purposes and yet be strictly speaking ambiguous or elliptic.

Twardowski's main point is that we can disambiguate ambiguous sentences or integrate elliptic ones in such a way that they become the appropriate means of expression of the judgment that they actually and strictly speaking express (Twardowski 1900, 156)—we can make sentences eternal, as we would say in our Post-Quinean age. Once we show that eternalization is possible, the confusion on which relativists rely is dispelled. For instance, if standing in Lvov on the High Castle Hill, I assert that it is raining,

I do not have in mind just any rain, falling at any place and time, but I voice a judgment about the rain falling here and now (Twardowski 1900, 151).

One could object that the true sentence ‘it is raining here and now’ is relative because it may become false, i.e. be true when uttered in Amsterdam and become false when uttered in the Dry Valley in Antarctica. Twardowski observes that this impression is, again, only due to the ambiguity of the indexicals ‘here and now’ in the sentence. Take thus the sentence

(i) It is raining here and now,

when uttered in Lvov, on 1 March 1900, in accordance with the Gregorian calendar, at noon, Central European Time, on the High Castle Hill. That sentence expresses the same judgment as

(i*) On 1 March 1900, in accordance with the Gregorian calendar, at noon, Central European Time, it is raining in Lvov, on the High Castle Hill and in its vicinity.

According to Twardowski, the difference between the two sentences is only in their brevity and their practical use. Take now the sentence

(ii) It is raining here and now,

when uttered in Krakow on 2 March 1900, in accordance with the Gregorian calendar, at noon, Central European Time, on the Castle Hill. That sentence expresses the same judgment as

(ii*) On 2 March 1900, in accordance with the Gregorian calendar, at noon, Central European Time, it is raining in Krakow, on the Castle Hill and in its vicinity.

It's not that we have in (i) and (ii) one and the same judgment; we have the same sentence, which expresses two different judgments, (i*) and (ii*). Therefore, one cannot argue that the same judgment can turn from true to false.

It is apparent that [the judgment expressed by (i) and (i*)], which [...] asserts that it is raining, is true not only at a particular time and place, but is always true. (Twardowski 1900, 153)

[...] Only sentences can be said to be relatively true; yet the truth of a sentence depends on the truth of the judgment expressed by that sentence; usually a given sentence can express various judgments, some true, some false, and it is thus relatively true because it expresses a true judgment only under certain conditions, i.e. if we consider it as an expression of a judgment which is true (Twardowski 1900, 169).

Notice that Twardowski is not saying that judgments can be integrated or completed: the judgments we formulate in our head, and which are true or false, are complete and fully unambiguous. It is for this reason that he can think that the procedure of completing sentences as expressions of judgments can be carried out.

An important thing to notice in Relative Truths is that Twardowski, differently from what Meinong and Łukasiewicz were to do, did not question the principle of contradiction or the principle of the excluded middle.

Twardowski's idea that one can have absolute truth in an all-changing world has been recently taken up by Simons (2003).

3.2 Actions and Products (1912)

For quite some time Twardowski thought that logic was dependent on psychology, and continued to hold the psychologistic idea of meaning as mental content from Content and Object. In his ‘Self-Portrait,’ Twardowski says that he changed his mind in an anti-psychologistic sense because of Husserl's Logical Investigations (1900/01).[9] ‘Actions and Products’ (1912) is the first printed work where Twardowski favors an ‘Aristotelian’ view of ideal meaning, i.e. of meaning in specie, which he associates with that of Husserl's in the Logical Investigations.

In marking the line of demarcation between logic and psychology on the basis of the distinction act/product which underlies his theory of meaning, Twardowski writes:

Indeed, a rigorous demarcation of products from actions has already contributed enormously to liberating logic from psychological accretions. (Twardowski 1912, §45, 132)

Twardowski's mature theory of meaning is connected with the rigorous definition of the distinction between actions and products of actions (while in Relative Truths he speaks of judgments as actions or products). On the basis of grammatical analyses, purporting however to show logically salient differences, Twardowski establishes a basic distinction between physical, psychical (i.e. mental), and psychophysical actions and their products. The analysis is reminiscent in philosophical style of that of ‘the presented’ in Content and Object, though more general, and a nice example of the method which has become now strongly associated with analytic philosophy.

The relationship between an action and what results from it, its product, is exemplified linguistically in the relationship between a verb and the corresponding noun as internal complement (Twardowski 1912, §1, 10; §8, 107):

Act Product
Physical running run
Mental judging judgment
Psychophysical speaking speech

A psychophysical product (e.g., a speech) differs from a mental product (e.g., a judgment) because it is perceptible to senses; it differs from a physical product (e.g., a run) because in the psychophysical action which produces it (speaking) a mental action is also involved, which has bearing on the physical action, and thus on its product (§10). In some cases, a psychophysical product expresses a mental product; for instance, a sentence is a psychophysical product which expresses a mental product, a judgment.

Twardowski points out that the meaning of the noun ‘judgment,’ like other nouns (‘mistake’), is ambiguous between action and product. A judgment in the sense of the action (a judging) is a judgment in the psychological sense, while a judgment in the sense of the product is a judgment in the logical sense (§14) (a third meaning of ‘judgment’ is that of ‘disposition, aptitude to make correct judgments,’ §15).

Twardowski points out that he uses ‘judgment’ in the sense of ‘judgment in the logical sense,’ i.e. the product of the action of judging, and he clarifies that what he means now by ‘judgment-product’ is the content of judgment in Content and Object (§24, n. 37, 117). Exactly as it was the case there, the judgment exists as long as someone performs the corresponding action of judging; for this reason, it is called a non-enduring product (§23, 116).

Non-enduring products do not exist in actuality separately from the corresponding actions, but only in conjunction with them; we can only analyze them abstractly apart from these actions. On the other hand, enduring products can and do exist in actuality apart from the actions owing to which they arise (Twardowski 1912, n. 41, 116).

Enduring products last longer than the action which produces them; they originate from a transformation or a rearrangement of pre-existing physical material in the course of the action: footprints in the sand are enduring products arising from the change of configuration of grains of sand (the material) as a product of the action of walking applied to that material (Twardowski points out that the product is not the grains of sand arranged in some way, but the arrangement itself, §26). If actions are processes, non-enduring products are events whereas enduring products present themselves as things (§ 27). Among enduring products, we find physical products (such as footprints in the sand) and psychophysical products (such as paintings). A mental product, such as a judgment, is never enduring (§29), but it can have its expression in an enduring psychophysical product, such as a written sentence.

The process of preserving non-enduring products such as judgments in enduring products such as written sentences is a complex one (§37), and goes in two steps.

In step one a spoken sentence is produced which expresses a judgment, in such a way that the judgment is the meaning of the sentence and the sentence is the sign of the judgment. The process goes as follows. A non-enduring mental product, a judgment (together with the action of judging), which is non-perceptible, gives rise—by being its (partial) cause—to a non-enduring psychophysical product, a spoken sentence, which is perceptible. In this case, the spoken sentence is the expression of the judgment (§30). Now, if the spoken sentence becomes itself a partial cause of another judgment, which (we would say) is a token of the same type of the initial judgment (by partially causing an action of judging which produces that other judgment in another person or at a different time in the same person), then the spoken sentence can also count as the sign of the judgment, and the judgment as the meaning of the expression (§32, §34). The condition just sketched in the antecedent is fundamental: without it, a sentence p might very well have been an expression of a judgment j once (j was a partial cause of p), but no meaning is linked with p: for, if p is incomprehensible, namely it is not a partial cause of another judgment j′, then nothing can be said to be its meaning (§31).

Step two is to preserve the spoken sentence (a non-enduring psychophysical product) in an enduring psychophysical product s, a written sentence.[10] When a judgment is preserved in this way, it has in the sign an existence called potential. This is because the sign may at any moment cause the formation of an identical or similar judgment (Twardowski 1912, §34), and it will be able to (partially) cause judgments as long as it lasts. In consequence of this, ‘meaning’ can therefore also mean

the capacity to evoke a mental product in the individual on whom a psychophysical product acts as a sign of that mental product, or, more briefly, the capacity to bring the corresponding mental product to awareness. (Twardowski 1912, n. 51, 125.)

Once they are preserved in this two-step way, non-enduring products assume not only the illusory appearance of enduring products, but also of products which are somehow independent from the actions which produce them. The appearance of independence is made stronger by the fact that we do as if one and the same judgment-product existed in all individuals, although many judgment-products are elicited by the written sentence-product. All these many judgments are different from each other, but, insofar as we consider a judgment to be the meaning of a sentence which is its sign

there must be a group of common attributes in these individual mental products. And it is precisely these common attributes (in which these individual products accord) that we ordinarily regard as the meaning of the psychophysical product, as the content inherent in it, provided of course that these common attributes correspond to the intent with which that psychophysical product was utilized as a sign. [...] Thus, we speak of only a single meaning of a sign—barring cases of ambiguity—and not of as many meanings as there are mental products that are aroused or capable of being aroused, by that sign in the persons on whom it acts. Now, a meaning conceived in this matter is no longer a concrete mental product, but something at which we arrive by way of an abstraction performed on concrete products. (Twardowski 1912, §39, 128)

To this passage, Twardowski appends a note referring to Husserl's notion of ideal meaning. The relationship between Husserl's and Twardowski's notion of meaning as well as the status of Twardowski's unique meaning has been object of discussion (see Paczkowska-Łagowska 1979, Buczyńska-Garewicz 1980, Placek 1996, Brandl 1998). These matters should be considered as yet unsettled.

The introduction of the notion of the unique meaning of a sentence leads Twardowski to make a further distinction between substitutive (artefacta) and non-substitutive judgments. Substitutive judgments aren't real judgments, but fictitious ones. The latter are in fact the presented judgments of Content and Object; the difference is that in Actions and Products, Twardowski applies the concept of substitutive judgments explicitly to logic: the sentences uttered or written by logicians-at-work are not sentences which express or have as meanings judgments which are really passed by them, but only presented judgments, produced thus by actions of presenting—which are different actions from actual judging acts. This happens for instance when a logician constructs a valid syllogism made up of materially false sentences to give examples of formally valid inferences (§44, 130). In this case, the logician does not actually judge that all triangles are square, that all squares are round, and that all triangles are round, but she merely presents the corresponding judgments. The sentences ‘all triangles are square,’ ‘all squares are round,’ and ‘all triangles are round’ are not real sentences, but artificial ones, because they are “expressions of artificial products that substitute for actual judgments, namely merely represented judgments” (Ibid.). The meanings of these artificial sentences are artificial judgments, because they are merely presented, not passed. These artificial judgments are the subject-matter of logic (on this point, Twardowski is again indebted to Bolzano). Operating with surrogate sentences such as ‘all triangles are square’ constitutes the most extreme example of “making mental products independent of the actions owing to which alone they can truly (actually) exist” (§44, 131).

Bibliography

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Secondary Sources, References and Further Reading

Other Internet Resources

Related Entries

Bolzano, Bernard | Brentano, Franz | Brentano, Franz: theory of judgement | Husserl, Edmund | Ingarden, Roman | intentionality | Leśniewski, Stanisław | Lvov-Warsaw School | Meinong, Alexius | mereology | nonexistent objects | psychologism | Wundt, Wilhelm Maximilian

Acknowledgments

Many thanks to Lieven Decock, Wim de Jong, Iris Loeb, Venanzio Raspa, Stefan Roski, Maria van der Schaar, an anonymous reviewer, the SEP editor Ed Zalta, and to my students Koen Kramer, Remco Reisig and Jeroen Smid for helpful comments on an earlier version. Work on this entry has been supported by ERC Starting Grant TRANH Project No 203194.