Elijah Delmedigo

First published Tue Jan 29, 2019

Elijah Del Medigo is a unique figure in the history of western philosophy. In the realm of Jewish thought he is mostly remembered for Beḥinat ha-Dat (Examination of Religion)—a work which discusses the role and function of philosophical discourse within the Jewish-religious sphere. Yet Del Medigo also played a central role in the development of the Averroist tradition in the Latin west: translating works by and composing commentaries on the works of Averroes, at the request of his Christian associates and patrons in the last quarter of the fifteenth century. In order to fully appreciate the nature of Del Medigo’s contribution it is therefore necessary to evaluate both aspects of his thought, within the context of its background: the Jewish community in Candia where Del Medigo received his initial formation, and the Christian intellectual circles of northern Italy, where Del Medigo spent most of his professional career.

1. Life of Elijah Del Medigo

Elijah Del Medigo was born in Candia (nowadays Heraklion), in the island of Crete, in 1458 or shortly before that. Crete being a Venetian colony, Del Medigo traveled to Venice around 1480. The reasons for this move cannot be determined with certainty; one suggestion is that Del Medigo moved to Padua in order to study medicine (Cassuto 1918: 222; Ross 1984: 18). However and whatever were his initial motives, Del Medigo’s activity while in Italy concentrated around the instruction of philosophy and the composition of philosophical works. More specifically, during his long stay in the Italian peninsula Del Medigo earned his fame as translator of and commentator on works by Averroes, and as the author of original treatises aimed at clarifying Averroes’ doctrines in various fields. The target audience of these works were leading Christian figures within the intellectual circles of Padua and Venice, among them Giovanni Pico della Mirandola and Domenico Grimani. During the academic year 1480/81 Del Medigo composed his Quaestio de primo motore and Quaestio de efficientia mundi following a public discussion in Padua, which led scholars to speculate that Del Medigo held an official role in that university (Montada 2013: 165). It seems however that while Del Medigo did play a major role in the intellectual life in the Veneto in that period, he was not officially affiliated with the university of Padua. Around 1482 Del Medigo moved to Venice, returned again to Padua, and in the years 1484–85 stayed with Pico della Mirandola in Florence. During the academic year 1485/86 we find Del Medigo again in Padua (Ross 1984: 20), and it is around that time he composed his commentary on the De substantia orbis. Del Medigo then continued to travel throughout the cities of Northern Italy, spending some time in Venice in 1488 under the patronage of Domenico Grimani. During his Italian sojourn Del Medigo composed four original works, wrote two commentaries on works by Averroes, and translated about nine works by Averroes from Hebrew into Latin.

At around 1490 Del Medigo returned to Crete. As is often the case with details concerning Del Medigo’s life, the reasons for his return are not entirely clear. According to Ross, Del Medigo experienced general discomfort with a growing intellectual trend of the Italian Renaissance, oriented more towards Neoplatonic and Kabbalistic tendencies than towards the rationalist speculation of the Aristotelian schools of the Middle Ages (see Ross 1984: 24–25). Be it as it may, it was following his return to Crete and during the last years of his life that Del Medigo composed what would become his most famous work, Beḥinat ha-Dat, which will be discussed in detail below. Del Medigo died in Candia around 1492/1493 (Ross 1984: 21–22; Licata 2013a: 48),

A common trait of Del Medigo’s literary output is a clear taste for Aristotelian philosophy in its Averroist guise. This is manifested both in his translations and commentaries on Averroes, as well as in the Beḥinat ha-Dat (although Averroes’ name is not mentioned in that work, for reasons which will be discussed below). Despite this overarching feature, Del Medigo’s oeuvre is also characterized by a dichotomy, geographical in as much as it is linguistic, religious and intellectual: Crete vs. Italy, Jewish thought vs. Paduan Aristotelianism, Hebrew vs. Latin. We will examine Del Medigo’s activity as cohesive whole yet in light of these different backgrounds and circumstances.

2. The Italian Period

As mentioned above, the bulk of Del Medigo’s creative period was spent in Northern Italy, approximately between the years 1480–1490. This fact is significant, as the Italian intellectual environment had a decisive impact on the shaping of Del Medigo’s philosophical taste. Padua, in which Del Medigo lived, wrote, and taught, was at that time a major center for the study of the works of Averroes, with his works being widely circulated, discussed and commented upon. Averroes’ impact was so significant there that that modern scholars later coined the term “Paduan Averroism”. While the validity of a robust notion of a Paduan Averroist school has been put into question, it is beyond doubt that Del Medigo’s Italian works reflect the intellectual climate of his time and place (see Engel 2015: 496). What set Del Medigo additionally apart from his fellow Christian scholars was his ability to read the works of Averroes which had survived in medieval Hebrew translations. Del Medigo therefore could bridge these philosophical traditions, commenting upon Averroes’ works that circulated among the Latin readers in Christian Padua while also relying on works by Averroes which only survived in Hebrew. In addition, Del Medigo was translating these Hebrew versions into Latin, engaging in a “twofold exercise of translation and commentary” (Montada 2013: 163). The full list of Averroes’ works translated by Del Medigo from Hebrew into Latin includes the following (source in brackets):

  • Epitome of the Meteorologica (Vat lat. 4550, ff. 1v–52r)
  • Middle Commentary on the Meteorologica (Vat. lat. 4550, ff. 53r–61v)
  • Preface to the Long Commentary on Metaphysica XII (Del Medigo translated the preface twice. BnF lat. 6508, ff. 78r–81r and the 1488 edition of In meteora Aristotelis)
  • Quaestiones in Analitica priora (Vat. lat. 4552 and several Renaissance editions)
  • Middle Commentary on the Metaphysica , books I–VII and a fragment of book VIII (1560 printed edition)
  • Fragment from the Epitome of the Metaphysica (BnF lat. 6508)
  • De spermata
  • Sections from the Middle Commentary on the De partibus animalium (Vat. lat. 4549, ff. 21r–57v)
  • Epitome of Plato’s Republic (modern critical edition, 1992)
  • A section from Averroes’ Epitome of the De anima (Vat. lat. 4549, ff. 11r–18r)
  • Liber de proprietatibus elementorum (Vat. lat. 4549, ff. 1–6r, Giunta edition 1496)

Del Medigo’s activity as a translator was part of a larger wave of Hebrew-into-Latin translations of Averroes during the fifteenth and the sixteenth centuries (see Hasse 2006). In addition to the translations themselves, we also find correspondences between Del Medigo and his patrons, in which the translations were discussed.

3. Original Works

Apart from translating the works of Averroes, Del Medigo also wrote original compositions aimed at elucidating Averroes’ doctrines, as well as commentaries on works such as the Physics and De substantia orbis. The aim of these works and commentaries was to clarify and elucidate the views of Averroes on various themes, and to contextualise these views as widely as possible within the context of the Averroist corpus. Mirroring a common medieval practice, Del Medigo’s originality as philosopher rested not in the introduction of a new metaphysical scheme, i.e., departing from the foundations of Aristotelian physics and metaphysics, but in interpreting and reinterpreting an existing body of works and doctrines. From a methodological perspective, Del Medigo shared with his fellow Paduan Averroists a polemical tendency, arguing that a true understanding of Averroes’ doctrines required the rejection of previous interpretations. Such false interpretations, in Del Medigo’s view, were carried forward either by anti-Averroists (most notably Thomas Aquinas) as well as by followers of Averroes, past and present, who misunderstood and misconstrued the latter’s doctrines. Among those, Del Medigo’s chief target was the fourteenth century Averroist John of Jandun, whom Del Medigo repeatedly attacks in his works and commentaries. John of Jandun was one scholar frequently cited in the works of other Paduan Averroists, most often to reject his interpretations (Hasse 2007: 324–25; Mahoney 1997: 140; Engel 2017: 20–23). Other scholastic authors mentioned by Del Medigo were Albert the Great, Giles of Rome, William of Ockham and Walter Burleigh (Montada 2013: 165–66, 169). Del Medigo’s reference to these authors, as well as his open critique of John of Jandun, portrays him as a prominent Jewish representative of the Latin scholastic tradition, and in particular of the Averroist Paduan school of the late fifteenth century (see Zonta 2006).

Thematically, Del Medigo’s Italian works concern Aristotelian physics, metaphysics, and psychology. The works are mutually related, as metaphysical discussions rely on physical notions such as matter, form, and causality. Thus, for instance, in his physical works, in his psychological work the Two Investigations, and in Del Medigo’s personal correspondence with Giovanni Pico della Mirandola, one comes across the denial of the possibility of creation ex nihilo (Kieszkowski 1964: Licata 2013a: 63; 72; Engel 2017: 39). Therefore, and despite their diverging thematic orientation, Del Medigo’s works ought to be perceived as a cohesive whole, aimed at clarifying Averroes’ positions in a variety of fields.

3.1 Physics and Metaphysics

Del Medigo’s physical and metaphysical works are the De primo motore, Quaestio de efficientia mundi, De esse et essentia et uno as well as his Annotationes in librum De phisico auditu super quibusdam dictis Commentatoris. These works were collected and printed during the sixteenth century (now available as a modern facsimile edition, see bibliography below). Another work by Del Medigo which concerns physical themes is his commentary on Averroes’ De substantia orbis. This work has survived in two manuscripts, a Latin autograph and a Hebrew translation of the Latin text, made by Del Medigo himself (a Hebrew-Latin bilingual critical edition of this work is currently under preparation).

A reoccurring theme in Del Medigo’s physical works is the nature of Divine causality. This is the main theme of both the Quaestio de efficientia mundi as well as the De primo motore. Divine causality was a popular theme throughout the Middle Ages and the Renaissance, and by participating in this discussion—clarifying and endorsing Averroes’ view on the matter—Del Medigo is again shown to be participating in what was essentially a Christian scholastic debate (Licata 2013a: 61; Montada 2013: 158). The Quaestio de efficientia mundi, composed in 1480 at the request of Girolamo Donato, asks whether God, the prime mover, is only the cause of the celestial bodies’ movement, or of their essence and existence as well (Licata 2013c: 59–60). In his discussion Del Medigo is relying, among other sources, on the short, middle and long commentaries on the Metaphysics as well as on Averroes’ De substantia orbis. Del Medigo himself translated the introduction of book XII of the Metaphysics from Hebrew into Latin (Montada 2013: 164), and his tendency to include in his original compositions citations from treatises which he himself translated is characteristic of Del Medigo’s work in general (see Engel: 2017: 18). At Del Medigo’s own admission, the Quaestio de efficientia mundi consists of arguments collected from the works of Averroes, leading to the conclusion that God is not only the mover of the celestial spheres, but their efficient cause as well. Here Del Medigo’s discussion is echoing an internal Averroist debate, arguing against the interpretation of John of Jandun, who held that God is only the final cause of the universe, not its efficient cause (Licata 2013a: 60). God is the efficient cause of the spheres, Del Medigo explains, not by creating them ex nihilo, but by guaranteeing their movement, which in turn constitute their being. He therefore endorses a qualified sense of efficient causality, according to which whoever grants a thing its essence—as God eternally grants the spheres their movement—may be considered an efficient cause in congruence with Averroes’ position as expounded in works such the Destructio destructionum and De substantia orbis. (Del Medigo 1480a: f. 140r; Licata 2013c: 62–63; Licata 2013a: 53–54). Closely related to the Quaestio de efficientia mundi is Del Medigo’s De primo motore, written around the same time. In that work, Del Medigo arrives at the same conclusion, i.e., God as the efficient as well as the formal and final cause of the universe. Creation is interpreted as eternal act of creation, and the eternity of the world becomes compatible with the existence of a creator (see Del Medigo 1480a: f. 134r; Licata 2013a: 57, 62):

The being of the celestial bodies exists and endures because of movement, and what gives movement, makes the movement, and since the being of these celestial bodies is not accomplished except by movement, who gives movement accomplishes their being (Del Medigo 1480a: f. 129, translation in Montada 2013: 178–79)

The question concerning the nature of God’s agency also has bearing on the nature of matter and form in the translunar world. Matter and form are attributed to worldly beings and to the celestial bodies only equivocally—otherwise celestial beings would suffer generation and corruption as beings in the sublunar world. The immaterial form of the celestial spheres guarantees their eternal movement, and by eternally moving them God is constituted as their efficient cause (Montada 2013: 179). The nature of translunar matter and form was also discussed by Averroes in his De substantia orbis, a work on which Del Medigo wrote a lengthy commentary where he discusses the equivocal meaning of matter and form. Del Medigo references De substantia orbis throughout his works, again exemplifying the unified nature of his works, having at its focal point the works and doctrines of Averroes (see Licata 2015: 94).

Other contested physical themes which Del Medigo discusses are movement and infinity. Del Medigo endorses Averroes’ position in the long commentary on the Physics, where the latter argues that, according to Aristotle, movement is predicated equivocally as it is found in different categories: substance (a thing moving from non-being into being) or quality (a white thing becoming black), to mention two examples (Montada 2013: 170). Regarding infinity, Del Medigo’s starting point is Aristotle’s assertion that every magnitude is potentially subject to infinite division, yet that this is not the case with addition, as yet every magnitude is not subject to infinite addition (Montada 2013: 172). In his Annotationes in librum De phisico auditu, Del Medigo sides with Averroes and argues against Walter Burley’s interpretation. Division, Del Medigo holds, is intrinsically related to matter. It thus follows that the type of potency associated with division is permanent, and hence can never be realized. In other words, division entails permanent potency, yet the type of potency associated with addition may be fully realized. Whereas division is associated with matter, addition is associated with form, and whereas division is inherently potential, addition is a process which may achieve completion. Therefore one cannot construe infinite addition, not even potentially (Del Medigo 1486: f. 140r-v; Montada 2013: 174–75).

Del Medigo’s most distinct metaphysical work is his De ente et essentia et uno, composed following his conversations with Pico on being, essence and unity, siding with Averroes against Avicenna (Montada 2013: 163–64). Yet the lengthiest of all Del Medigo’s original composition is the Two Investigations on the Nature of the Human Soul, a work on Aristotelian psychology which concentrates on the nature and destiny of the human intellect.

3.2 Psychology

As the opening and closing lines of the Two Investigations indicate, Del Medigo composed the work at the request of his friend and Patron, Giovanni Pico della Mirandola. Apart from being Del Medigo’s lengthiest and most complex work, it also serves as the most striking evidence for the latter’s affinity with Paduan philosophical circles, as the nature of human intellect, and in particular its ontological status, was among the most hotly debated themes in Padua in Del Medigo’s time (see Hasse 2007, 2004: 115; Engel 2017: 20)

The unicity controversy was a philosophical and metaphysical as well as hermeneutical debate. The metaphysical aspect is reflected in the discussion concerning the nature of the human material intellect—i.e., our potential disposition for receiving thoughts—whether it is a single substance or multiple substances, and whether it is corporeal or separate from corporeal matter. Hermeneutically, the work attempts to discern the correct interpretation of certain passages from Averroes’ Long Commentary on the De anima and, more fundamentally, of certain passages in Aristotle’s De anima. In that work, it is not quite clear what Aristotle’s own position concerning the ontological status of the human intellect is. On the one hand, the material intellect is described as our intellect, by virtue of which we think. On the other hand, some of Aristotle’s remarks seem to indicate that the material intellect is separate in its existence from the individual human being. Throughout antiquity, the Middle Ages and the Renaissance, Aristotle’s interpreters debated this question, with Averroes’ discussion of it in his long commentary on the De anima the focal point of many of the later discussions. In chapter 3.5, commenting upon lines 429a21–24 in the De anima, Averroes in the long commentary stresses those aspects in Aristotle’s text which suggest that the intellect, despite possessing a certain relation to human individuals, is nonetheless a separate substance, shared by all humans. Once the long commentary on the De anima was translated into Latin, this interpretation was picked up by philosophers in the Latin west from the thirteenth century onwards, among them Elijah Del Medigo.

Del Medigo’s first investigation thus concerns the question whether the material intellect is a single substance, shared by all human beings, or whether each of us possesses her own intellect (Del Medigo 1482: f. 1r). Del Medigo’s method in discussing the question is a dialectical one, close to that of a Scholastic quaestio—considering the arguments for and against the proposed thesis (that the material intellect is one in number), before arriving at his own (Del Medigo’s) conclusion, following Averroes’ lead in the long commentary on the De anima. Del Medigo’s Two Investigations is therefore, at its core, an attempt to both clarify Averroes’ unicity thesis to Pico as well as illustrating its validity, and Del Medigo does so initially by a reductio ad absurdum of competing interpretations. Del Medigo first argues against those who claimed the intellects are many in number, i.e., that each of us possesses her own intellect. This, in turn, can be interpreted in two ways, which Del Medigo identifies as two concrete positions in the history of philosophy:

  1. The intellect is individuated as a material disposition (The view of Alexander of Aphrodisias)
  2. The intellect is individuated yet not as material disposition but as separate substance (A view which Del Medigo attributes to the “Theologians” but which in all likelihood is aimed at the Paduan Thomists)

Having refuted these two positions, i.e., the two ways according to which the intellect can be individuated, Del Medigo arrives at the remaining logical option: that the intellect is a separate substance, shared by all humans. This was the conclusion of Averroes, and Del Medigo then moves to illustrate the validity and coherence of this position.

In the second investigation, Del Medigo explores the nature of human conjunction with the agent intellect, again following Averroes’ interpretation of Aristotelian principles.

3.3 Beḥinat ha-Dat

Beḥinat ha-Dat is Del Medigo’s last and best known work, which received more scholarly attention than all of his other works combined. Unlike his Italian works, Beḥinat ha-Dat was composed in Hebrew at the request of Del Medigo’s pupil, Shaul Ashkenazi, following Del Medigo’s return to Crete. The overarching theme of the work is an attempt to legitimise philosophical practice within the Jewish religious realm. This attempt brings to mind Maimonides’ Guide of the Perplexed, though the most immediate source—which Del Medigo does not acknowledge for reasons which we will discuss below—is Averroes’ Decisive Treatise. The relation between Beḥinat ha-Dat and Averroes’ Decisive Treatise was discussed by various authors throughout the generations (see Ivry 1983: 251; Montada 2013: 158). And most recently by Giovanni Licata, who has convincingly illustrated Del Medigo’s reliance on the Decisive Treatise by citing parallel passages from the two works (see Licata 2013a: 129–86).

While the works composed during Del Medigo’s stay in Italy concern themes in Aristotelian natural sciences and metaphysics, Beḥinat ha-Dat may be described as meta-philosophical, as it discusses the relation between rational discourse and revealed religion. Del Medigo begins his discussion by presenting his main motivation in composing the work: to determine whether the study of philosophy is permissible, forbidden, or mandatory (Del Medigo 2013: 292). His conclusion (2013: 292–93) is that while the study of philosophy is not obligatory as such, it is mandatory for those who are capable of engaging in philosophical speculation. Such engagement will strengthen the student’s belief, as the philosophical sciences concern created beings, and the knowledge of created beings leads to the knowledge of the creator (2013: 294). Del Medigo emphasises that philosophical speculation alone is insufficient from a religious standpoint, as the Jewish philosopher still shares with the masses a belief in the words and instructions of the Torah (2013: 294). The philosopher ought to supply the true interpretation of the biblical narrative, to be circulated only among those capable of philosophical reflection (2013: 294). Exceptions are the fundamental tenets of the Jewish belief, the validity of which ought not be grounded in reason, let alone questioned. Such tenets, which are beyond the reach of philosophical speculation, are the possibility of prophecy, reward and punishment, and the possibility of miracles (2013: 310).

The investigation concerning valid modes of interpreting the Torah leads Del Medigo to discuss Kabbalistic interpretations, and to present his general stand concerning the Kabbalistic trend in Judaism (see Bland 1991). The majority of Jewish sages and Talmudists, Del Medigo argues (322–323), rejected the Kabbalistic interpretations and were drawn instead to philosophy and rational speculation. Del Medigo rejects the traditional attribution of Sefer ha-Zohar, the authoritative Kabbalistic work, to Shim’on Bar Yohay, and adds other arguments opposing the Kabbalistic-mystical interpretation of the Torah. Del Medigo’s criticism of the Kabbalah appears in his other works as well, for instance in his Hebrew version of the commentary on De substantia orbis (Del Medigo 1485: f. 41; Ross 1984: 20). Yet according to Ross, more than the Kabbalah itself, it was the Christian Kabbalah that Del Medigo was attacking in the Beḥinat ha-Dat (Ross 1984: 13).

Another related theme discussed by Del Medigo concerns the reasons for the commandments. Following Maimonides, Del Medigo argues that there is a rational foundation for prescribing the commandments to the Jewish people, even if not all reasons are entirely known, and that one major aspect is to “direct people to the Good, in so far as they are able to” (Del Medigo 2013: 336–38). The theme of the reasons for the commandments in fact encompasses all themes mentioned earlier: the place of philosophical reflection within the religious realm, the application of rational/philosophical interpretation of the biblical narrative, and Del Medigo’s criticism of the Kabbalistic interpretation of the Torah. Here, Del Medigo’s anti-Kabbalistic stand is manifested in his criticism of the Kabbalistic interpretation of the commandments: “for we humans can hardly improve ourselves, and how can we improve the divine worlds” (Del Medigo 2013: 342). Lastly, Beḥinat ha-Dat also discusses the rational status of the Christian creed, arguing that unlike the fundamental principles of Judaism, the Christian belief is fundamentally irrational (Lasker 2007: 25–28; Ross 1984: 26).

According to Del Medigo, his role model in composing Beḥinat ha-Dat was Maimonides, who inspired him in defining the relation between philosophical speculation and religious belief. While the influence of Averroes’ Decisive Treatise is apparent, Del Medigo never mentions the latter in Beḥinat ha-Dat. This is in sharp contrast to the Italian works, where Averroes was the ultimate philosophical authority (besides Aristotle) and Maimonides is rarely mentioned. The discrepancy between Del Medigo’s philosophical and meta-philosophical works is therefore manifested also in the authorities on which he relies. While Averroes was a leading philosophical authority among Scholastic circles in fifteenth century Padua, Maimonides’ position concerning the function of philosophical discourse within the religious realm had a profound impact on Jewish sages all throughout the middle ages, and Maimonides therefore serves Del Medigo in Beḥinat ha-Dat as his chief authoritative source (see Ross 1984: 11).

Considering all the above, it is not surprising that Beḥinat ha-Dat caught the attention of Jewish readership and Jewish scholars throughout the generations, and the debates between these scholars summed up recently in an article by Carlos Fraenkel (Fraenkel 2013). Certain scholars, starting with Adolph Hübsch, have argued that for Del Medigo the religious and the philosophical truths were in fact identical. Others, beginning with Julius Guttmann, who responded to Hübsch, argued that Del Medigo was in act influenced by the Christian “double truth” theory. Fraenkel himself argues that Del Medigo’s

stance on the relationship between philosophy and religion fundamentally agrees with that of Averroes, according to which “the truth does not contradict the truth”. (Fraenkel 2013: 312; for Fraenkel’s discussion on Hübsch and Guttmann see 2013: 219)

It is a significant fact that these scholars, while debating Del Medigo’s position on the relation between philosophy and religion, rely mostly on Del Medigo’s account in Beḥinat ha-Dat. The latter did, however, treat meta-philosophical issues present in the Italian works as well. In his Quaestio de efficientia mundi, for instance, Del Medigo clearly differentiates the realm of religious belief—where one may endorse the belief in creation ex nihilo—and the philosophical truth which seems to contradict this view. Del Medigo speaks in this context of two truths, one religious (“via legis”) and one philosophical (“via philosophica”) (Licata 2013a: 62). Yet this treatment, which appears as a formulation of the “double truth” theory, was being introduced in the form of a side remark, mainly to appease the mind of his Christian readers, and was nothing like the systematic treatment of the theme in Beḥinat ha-Dat (Licata 2015: 92). The question whether Del Medigo in fact held a coherent doctrine concerning the relation between revealed and scientific doctrines, or whether one should examine his statements on the subject on an ad hoc basis, still remains open and requires further study (Engel 2016).

4. Conclusion: Impact and Legacy

In the Hebrew versions of his philosophical works, as well as in Beḥinat ha-Dat, Del Medigo explicitly refers to himself as a Jewish sage and disciple of Maimonides, and often downplays the importance of his own Aristotelian compositions. Del Medigo would therefore have been pleased to discover that in modern scholarship he is mainly remembered as a Jewish thinker. Yet by judging the content of his Italian works, which constitute the bulk of his literary output, Del Medigo’s contribution to the history of philosophy is manifested in that he was among the first to merge, in his translations as well as in his original works, the Hebrew and Latin Averroist schools, which until his day existed as two separate philosophical traditions. By doing so, Del Medigo contributed to the creation of a unified corpus of Averroes’ works, which had a decisive impact on the Aristotelian Renaissance tradition and up until the early modern period. In other words, despite his religious affiliation, Del Medigo’s contribution lies clearly within the realm of the Aristotelian tradition, which, qua philosophical tradition, transcends religious and linguistic boundaries.

Bibliography

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