Intersections Between Pragmatist and Continental Feminism

First published Fri Dec 6, 2002; substantive revision Wed Sep 18, 2019

Feminist philosophy is a large and growing subfield of the discipline. Feminist philosophers vary in their methodologies and philosophical aims, and are often grouped by their approaches to philosophy, or by the philosophical traditions that have influenced them (for example, as analytic, continental, or pragmatist feminists). This entry provides an overview of the group of feminist thinkers whose work incorporates elements of both continental and pragmatist philosophies.

Given the occasional confusion of the colloquial and the philosophical senses of the term “pragmatism” and the slipperiness of the term “continental” (or “postmodern”) philosophy, a word about the two fields is in order before turning to feminist approaches to their intersections. The so-called classical period of American philosophy, best known for its creation of American pragmatism, was developed in the United States from the late nineteenth to the middle of the twentieth century by figures such as Jane Addams, W.E.B. Du Bois, John Dewey, William James, Alain Locke, George Herbert Mead, Charles Sanders Peirce, Josiah Royce, and Alfred North Whitehead.[1] Waning in popularity after the Second World War, American pragmatist philosophy experienced a revival in the 1970s, often credited to the “neo-pragmatist” work of Richard Rorty (see especially Rorty 1979), that continues today. Far from being an anti-theoretical position that champions level-headed practicality as is sometimes thought, pragmatist philosophy stresses the dynamic relationship between theory and practice and especially the value of each for transforming the other. It seeks to undermine other sharp dichotomies as well, including those between body and mind, subject and object, ends and means, and nature and culture. Viewing knowledge as a tool for enriching experience, pragmatism tends to be pluralistic, experimental, fallibilist, and naturalistic. Rejecting the quest for absolute certainty, it takes a meliorist attitude that human action sometimes can improve the world.

Pragmatism’s emphasis on experience, developed in the wake of Darwin’s evolutionary theory, perhaps best distinguishes it from other philosophical fields. Pragmatism demands that philosophy grow out of and test its merits in the “soil” of lived experience. This is not to abjure abstraction, but rather to insist that philosophy deal with the genuine problems of living organisms, not the artificial problems of an academic discipline. It is important to realize, however, that pragmatists understand the concept of experience as “double-barrelled,” in James’s words (James quoted in Dewey 2000, 463). Experience refers not only to the so-called “subjective” experience of a living being, but also to the “objective” world that is experienced by it. Biology and evolutionary theory teach that plants and non-human animals cannot live apart from the environments that feed and sustain them. Pragmatist philosophy incorporates this lesson by insisting that all of experience, including human experience, needs to be understood as an interaction between organism and environment. Functional distinctions can be made between the two, but for pragmatism, no sharp dichotomy between them exists.

Continental philosophy is more difficult to define as a class. Somewhat ironically, the concept of continental philosophy is a creation of philosophers in the United States who focus on (or who are influenced by) the work of post-Enlightenment European thinkers, especially those in France and Germany. While the range of European figures studied by continental philosophers is too large and varied to list comprehensively here, one could say that it begins with nineteenth century theorists such as Georg Wilhelm Friedrich Hegel, Søren Kierkegaard, Karl Marx, and Friedrich Nietzsche; continues with twentieth century thinkers such as Theodor Adorno, Louis Althusser, Walter Benjamin, Simone de Beauvoir, Gilles Deleuze, Michel Foucault, Sigmund Freud, Hans-Georg Gadamer, Martin Heidegger, Edmund Husserl, Jacques Lacan, Jean-François Lyotard, Herbert Marcuse, Maurice Merleau-Ponty, and Jean-Paul Sartre; and extends into the twenty-first century with contemporary writers such as Pierre Bourdieu, Jacques Derrida, Jürgen Habermas, Julia Kristeva, and Luce Irigaray.

Since the specific fields represented by these theorists range from genealogical philosophy, phenomenology, existentialism, and critical theory to deconstruction, hermeneutics, post-structuralism, and psychoanalytic philosophy, the label “continental” must be understood more as an umbrella concept than a precise term. Nevertheless, contemporary continental philosophies can be seen as sharing a suspicion of what Lyotard (1984) has called “grand narratives,” which are accounts of the world and human existence that (attempt to) legitimate and provide them with meaning from a position external to them. Some examples of grand narratives under attack by continental philosophers include the idea that facts and values are sharply opposed to one another, the assumption that the self is essentially unified, and the belief that the pursuit of knowledge is for its own sake rather than driven by particular human interests. A rejection of grand narratives does not entail the inability to make distinctions, such as those between fact and value, knowledge and politics, inside and outside, and thing and process. It instead means understanding those distinctions as made from a particular perspective and within a particular context, and remaining open to the criticism and possible rejection of them if they fail to serve the purposes for which they were selected. The outlook of continental philosophy thus tends to be historical and perspectival, emphasizing the co-constitutive relationship of subject and object, power and social-political location, and knowledge and truth.

In its perspectival, historical, and contextual approaches to philosophy, continental theory finds significant points of contact not only with American pragmatism, but also with much of contemporary feminist philosophy. In general and especially when influenced by continental and pragmatist philosophy, feminist philosophy can be seen as targeting the grand narratives of patriarchy and male privilege, arguing that many of the so-called objective and universal truths of philosophy are instead pronouncements made from a particular—that is, male-biased—point of view. Above all, as this essay will reveal, the dual impact of continental and pragmatist philosophy contributes to a feminism that challenges the philosophical construction of sharp dichotomies and opposed binaries. Such a challenge is feminist because even when dualisms do not explicitly refer to women, gender, or sexuality, they tend to be implicated in and to produce masculine (and particularly white masculine) privilege.

In spite of many affinities between pragmatist, continental, and feminist philosophies, there have historically been few feminists whose work is recognized as explicitly incorporating both of the other traditions. Instead, there have been a handful of feminists well known for working out of a continental tradition who also, in a less recognized fashion, have drawn from pragmatist themes and figures. In what follows, we discuss five themes that emerge in the work of feminists customarily associated with continental philosophy to illuminate the particular way that each combines pragmatist and continental thought. In the final section, we consider more recent work by feminists pioneering new uses of the intersection of continental and pragmatist feminism, and suggest possible future directions that the young field might take.

1. The Quests for Certainty and Purity

One of philosophy’s responses to the presence of flux and change in the world has been to seek stability in the fixed and unchanging. Another has been to try to rigidly order and compartmentalize that which is ambiguous or indeterminate. These quests for certainty and purity have been the concern of pragmatist and continental feminists because of their endorsement of traits seen as masculine and their corresponding rejection of those viewed as feminine. Given western culture’s association of women with the impure, ambiguous, and disorderly, the quest to free philosophy from those characteristics has been a simultaneous attempt to flee from everything associated with the feminine.

In The Flight to Objectivity: Essays on Cartesianism and Culture, Susan Bordo criticizes the “‘flight from the feminine’” that has resulted from philosophy’s quests for certainty and purity (1987, 118). She argues that in the wake of work by Richard Rorty, Michel Foucault, and feminist historians and philosophers of science such as Evelyn Fox Keller and Sandra Harding, philosophy cannot easily sustain its anti-cultural and non-historical accounts of the world. Adopting Rorty’s metaphor of “the mirror of nature” (1979) to criticize philosophy’s self-conception as a neutral reflection of what is given in the world,[2] Bordo provides a psychocultural analysis of the development of that mirror in the work of René Descartes. Rorty’s Nietzschean and Deweyan approach to philosophy understands it as a form of cultural therapy, that is, as a way to improve or “cure” the “illnesses” of contemporary society. Similarly, The Flight to Objectivity brings together feminist concerns and psychoanalytic tools to identify western culture’s Cartesian “disease.” Bordo’s diagnosis is that Cartesian anxiety in the face of epistemological doubt is in fact an anxiety due to separation from an organic universe conceived of as female.

Taking seriously the experiential bases of Descartes’s skepticism, Bordo identifies the epistemological problem over which Descartes obsessed to be that of psychological corruption, which threatens to make it impossible to know how and when to trust one’s felt sense of conviction when one believes something to be true. Drawing on Dewey’s analysis in The Quest for Certainty (1988) and the anthropological work of Mary Douglas, Bordo argues that an absolutist quest for purity is a common response to anxiety over the messiness and ambiguity of the world. Moreover, she explains that the quest for purity during times of high cultural anxiety is correlated with an increase in male social domination. As anthropologist Peggy Reeves Sanday’s cross-cultural findings demonstrate, male domination within a culture tends to be at its most extreme when that culture experiences itself as being in too much flux (Bordo 1987, 111). For Bordo, Descartes’s response to historical changes such as the cultural and scientific revolutions of the sixteenth and seventeenth centuries, such as Martin Luther’s reformation movement and Copernicus’s heliocentricism, was to attempt to establish a firm division between confusion and order, the impure and the pure, the ambiguous and the certain, the body and the mind, and the “dirty” from the “clean.” Descartes thus can be thought of as the quintessential “dirt-rejecter” of Western philosophy (1987, 82). As Bordo argues, the mark of Cartesianism is not so much its claims to neutral objectivity as it is its “passion for intellectual separation, demarcation, and order” (1987, 77). Given western culture’s long-standing association between reason, the orderly mind, and masculinity, on the one hand, and emotions, the messy body, and femininity, on the other, Descartes’ rejection of flux for order was at the same time a privileging of the (culturally constituted) masculine over the (culturally constituted) feminine.

Dewey once claimed that a felt sense of “insecurity generates the quest for certainty” (Dewey 1988, 203). Following up on that claim, Bordo argues that the problematic genius of Descartes was to find a way to convert his anxiety in the face of the impure and ambiguous into the confidence and certitude of objectivity. As Bordo explains, “Where there is anxiety, there will almost certainly be found a mechanism against that anxiety” (Bordo 1987, 75). Descartes took that which produced dread—the perceived barrenness of a mechanistic world—and turned it into an advantage, into that which makes objectivity, and thus also certainty, possible. In defense against the painful anxiety he felt about the process of separating from the organic whole of the universe, Descartes effectively declared that he willed and welcomed such a separation. His defense, in other words, can be seen as a reaction-formation to a painful loss. Tracing the historical and cultural masculinization of thought and the corresponding reconception of nature as dead and mechanical rather than organic and alive, Bordo demonstrates how what was lost was the previous cultural conception of a “female cosmos and ‘feminine’ orientation towards the world” (1987, 100). Descartes’s method of achieving absolute certainty thus is as much a “flight from the feminine” historically and culturally associated with the organic and fluid, as it is the creation of a new epistemological criterion of and method for objectivity.

2. The Evolutionary Becoming of Spatiality and Materiality

Space is often thought of as relatively static in comparison with the dynamism of time. Time moves forward, we often say, while space is commonly conceived as merely an empty gap that passively rests between, for example, the walls of a house or the beams of a bridge. What would it mean, however, to question this dualistic opposition of space and time? What if space were also thought of as dynamic and moving? And what impact would this revised conception of space have on philosophical ideas about the bodies that inhabit space? As some feminists have argued, rethinking spatiality as becoming, rather than as static being, can help philosophy rethink bodily life and materiality in dynamic ways as well. Given the long-association of women with bodies and materiality, moreover, the reconceptualization of the latter has important implications for women and feminism.

In Architecture from the Outside: Essays on Virtual and Real Space (2001), Elizabeth Grosz explores these conceptual questions about space, time, and materiality by working in the intersections of architecture and philosophy. Engaging in “conceptual or philosophical [rather than concretely architectural] experiments,” she forces architecture to examine the importance of temporality and sexuality for practices of building and making and attempts to render both architecture’s and philosophy’s concepts of space more dynamic and fluid (2001, xviii). Grosz argues that architecture is problematic from a feminist perspective because it largely has ignored questions of sexual and racial differences. Not putting enough women’s bathrooms, relative to men’s, in concert halls, auditoriums, and other public buildings that draw large numbers of people is one simple example of this neglect. Yet it also can be seen in the more complex ways that spaces are gendered and raced. How, for example, does architecture contribute to raced and racist urban spaces by aiding the gentrified rebuilding of inner cities, a process that tends to displace poor, non-white populations for the benefit of middle class white people? Architecture’s neglect of questions such as these is a serious matter for Grosz. Nonetheless, she argues that as a kind of liminal point between culture and nature, the field of architecture also presents an ideal opportunity for feminists to trouble many of the absolutized binary categories that often plague philosophy: inside and outside, self and other, and subject and object, to name just a few. It might also help philosophy “think of itself more humbly as a mode of producing rather than as a mode of knowing or intellectually grasping or mastering concepts, moving [philosophy] closer to everyday life and its concerns, which would be good for [it]” (2001, 6). As a self-proclaimed “outsider” to architecture—a term used playfully given that she will smudge the lines between inside and outside—Grosz thus traverses the boundaries between architecture and philosophy to address questions of materiality and becoming that might produce changes in the lived experience of spatiality.

Grosz is interested in a philosophy that would integrate dynamic and productive notions of change and time into that of space. On her view, such integration would help both architects and philosophers think of space in dynamic and creative, rather than static and worn-out ways. According to Grosz, such a philosophy requires above all “pragmatic models” (2001, 120). With the term “pragmatic,” Grosz includes thinkers in both the traditions of American and continental philosophy who operate with a “self-consciously evolutionary orientation” (2001, 169). This “philosophical pragmatism meanders from Darwin, through Nietzsche, to the work of Charles Sanders Peirce, William James, Henri Bergson, and eventually through various lines of descent, into the diverging positions of Richard Rorty, on the one hand, and Gilles Deleuze on the other” (2001, 169). Positioning herself within this lineage, Grosz affirms “pragmatist philosophers who put the questions of action, practice, and movement at the center of ontology” (2001, 169). Doing so allows them, for example, to “understand[d] the [inorganic] thing as question, as provocation” for organic life (2001, 169). This would be to take becoming and an evolutionary openness to the future various seriously for it would dare to think of the so-called inanimate, static thing as continuous with animate, dynamic, organic—including human—life. Doing so would operate with the distinction between animate and inanimate in order to show their interactions. It would acknowledge that the animate and the inanimate exist as poles on a continuum, where differences shade into one another rather than stand starkly apart.

In questioning conventional boundaries between thing and non-thing, Grosz’s goal is not to completely collapse all distinctions between binary categories, but rather to complicate their relationships so that new possibilities might open up. Likewise, the purpose of her work is not to urge the attempt to live in a world of total flux—as if such a thing were possible. Following James, Grosz instead insists that the “teeming flux of the real” must be rendered into discrete objects and that human beings are not able to choose not to do so (2001, 179). What she adds, however, is that philosophy and architecture need to recognize that categories for objectifying the world do not fully capture it in all its complex multiplicity and that there is a residue that remains. This residual excess is not in rigid opposition to objects and categories; rather it and the world of flux are continuous with the world of discrete objects, in dialogue and movement with them. To think the relationship between flux and object as Grosz would have philosophers do is to think the thing as she has described it: as a fluid “point of crossing” rather than as a static fixity (2001, 171).

Grosz does not often provide explicit details about how such a “philosophical pragmatism” might benefit feminism. Indeed, as she says of herself in an interview that composes chapter one of the book, “I feel sure that in order to keep my feminist work alive I have to keep it at bay, at a bit of a distance” (2001, 26). In the context of the entire book, however, one can understand her distanced feminism as another functional “outsider” to both philosophy and architecture that, like all outsides, forces those positioned within the inside to really “think” (2001, 64). In the example of her own work, Grosz claims that she had to move away from her earlier work on the body (Grosz 1994) because she had “worked to death” the topic. Moving to the field of architecture has allowed her to approach the question of materiality in a fresh way (2001, 26). Making that move, Grosz offers feminists an example of how to get some distance from and thus gain a new perspective on familiar feminist concepts so that fresh insight into them is possible. Grosz thus provisionally preserves the distinctions between continental and pragmatist philosophy, architecture, and feminism in order to enable the “infection by one side of the border of the other [and] a becoming otherwise of each of the terms thus bounded” (2001, 65).

3. Technoscientific Hybridity and Fetishism

Technology and science have had and continue to have an enormous impact on the contemporary world. The weapons, medicines, automobiles, electronics, and other goods they produce have been both beneficial to and problematic for human and non-human animal life. Important to understanding the particular impact of technology and science is to focus not just on their products, however, but also on the processes by which those products come into existence—and, moreover, not only the mechanical, but also the social processes as well. The products of contemporary technoscience are hybrid compilations of material goods, human labor, and social relations that often are oppressive. As such, they cannot be understood if they are conceived of as mere things, abstracted away from their social contexts. Doing so interferes with the ability to ask questions about whom technoscience benefits and whom it exploits or otherwise harms.

Much of Donna Haraway’s work stresses the importance of asking these questions. In Simians, Cyborgs, and Women: The Reinvention of Nature (1991), Donna Haraway introduces the figure of the cyborg, an “impure” creature who scrambles orderly divisions between the natural and artificial/technical, and the human and the non-human/animal. Continuing her exploration of “ontological confusing bodies” in Modest_Witness@Second_Millennium.FemaleMan©_Meets_ OncoMouse™: Feminism and Technoscience (1997, 186), Haraway speaks as a cyborgian “modest witness” to contemporary technoscience, at once both implicated in and suspicious of its processes and products. Extending her earlier insights into how humans “polish an animal mirror to look for ourselves” (1991, 22), Haraway criticizes the way that science takes nature as a static given, congealing and obscuring social relations such that they can be taken as decontextualized things-in-themselves. (It should be noted, however, that other feminists have taken issue with Haraway’s characterization of science. Mary Magada-Ward (2014) in particular has argued from a pragmatic feminist perspective that Haraway’s willingness to criticize science as one narrative among others is irresponsible, and endangers the very liberatory projects with which feminists are aligned.)

For Haraway, Western culture is extremely fetishistic, mistaking “a fixed thing for the doings of power-differentiated lively beings” (1997, 135). To analyze the web of economic, psychological, and philosophical threads that compose this fetishism, Haraway appeals to the work of Marx, Freud, and Whitehead. Economically, socio-technological relations often are taken to be commodities whose value is intrinsic rather than the product of the labor and practices of organic life. Hand-in-hand with this politico-economic fetishism goes a psychological denial of this substitution that makes the “mistake” of taking things for processes very difficult to recognize. Finally, wound up with these two strands is the philosophical error that misunderstands concrete, relational processes as fixed, simple abstractions (1997, 147). All three threads of this fetishism are bound up in, for example, the computer chip, which is incredibly valuable and necessary to late capitalist, technological society. Locating its value in pieces of metal and plastic and electronic codes, however, we lose sight of the historical and labor processes that produce and sustain the computer’s existence. A product of World War II, the computer was developed to help calculate artillery trajectories so that bombs would be more effective (read: destroy more property and kill more people). Today, computer chips and mother boards often are produced by Asian women in the U.S. and various third-world countries, who are seen as especially appropriate for such jobs because of their “Oriental” nimble finger work and attentiveness to small details (1991, 154, 177). When we fetishize the chip, we are incapable of seeing this “final appropriation of women’s bodies in a masculinist orgy of war” (1991, 154). That is to say, we render ourselves incapable of understanding how the materials, processes, and concerns of a highly militarized, technoscientific culture shape the world and our very selves.

The process philosophy of Whitehead subtly provides crucial support for Haraway’s analysis of fetishism and, indeed, much of her critique of technoscience. As Haraway explains in a footnote to Modest_Witness (1997, 297n21), Whitehead has been important to her work since at least her days as a graduate student, and she believes that the general thrust of his ideas can be discerned in a great deal of feminist science studies and philosophy of science. For Whitehead, everything in the world is a “concrescence of prehensions,” prehensions being the grasping or feeling of one thing by another in their on-going relations of becoming (1997, 47). A concrescence of prehensions, then, is a growing together of processes of becoming that allows some relations to function as a unified, distinct thing, or “actual entity.” What Whitehead calls the fallacy of misplaced concreteness occurs when abstract logical constructions—such as the notion of a thing’s primary qualities or of its simple location in space-time—are (mis)taken for the concreteness of processual, actual entities. The effect of this mistake, in Haraway’s terms, is the fetishization of things. Allying herself with Whitehead, Haraway emphasizes the prehensional “reachings into each other in the tissues of the world” (1997, 147)—for example, genes, computer chips, fetuses, OncoMouse™—that are the concrete, actual materials of Western technoscience.

Although she argues against fetishism, it would be misleading to conclude that Haraway is thus also arguing “for” the ontologically messy hybridity that results when one gives fetishism up. Neither, however, is Haraway “against” hybridity. Both of these positions are too categorical for the issue at hand. In Haraway’s view, hybridity presents possible dangers and potential benefits alike and thus must be examined in its various particularities. Haraway’s task, thus, is to pragmatically ask, “for whom and how [do] these hybrids work?” (1997, 280 n1) Who benefits, for example, from OncoMouse™, the mouse with human genes for developing breast cancer that has been developed and trademarked by DuPont? This question not only points to the issue of human beings’ taking “noninnocent responsibility” for the use of non-human animals as research tools (1997, 82). It also points to questions about environmental toxins, environmental racism, and the availability and affordability of health care for African American women in light of their increasing death rates from cancer while those of white women remain the same (1997, 113). Asking questions such as these would help enable contemporary technoscience to engage in practices of “witnessing,” that is to “stan[d] publicly accountable for, and psychically vulnerable to [its] visions and representations” (1997, 267). For Haraway, such accountability would open up the possibility that technosciences “knowledge products” might at the same time be “freedom projects” as well (1997, 269).

4. The Semiotic Construction of Sexual Subjects

In 1949, Simone de Beauvoir famously claimed that “[o]ne is not born, but rather becomes, a woman” (Beauvoir 1989, 267). Contemporary pragmatist feminist and continental feminist philosophers generally agree with this claim, rejecting the notion that the category of woman (and man) and the conception of femininity (and masculinity) are simply given in nature. As a result, some have explored the role of social institutions—such as the media, the work place, and education—in creating the particular type of gendered, sexual subject called “woman.” Others have focused on the inner mechanisms of this process, so to speak, asking how the unconscious desires of women are constituted such that their psychical lives contribute to their gender and sexuality. These two approaches need not be seen as antithetical, however. An understanding of how women are constituted as sexual subjects is perhaps best achieved by exploring the intersection of the social “outside” and the psychical “inside” in the formation of subjectivity.

Teresa De Lauretis’s work takes this intersectional approach, allying feminism, semiotics, psychoanalysis, and film criticism to explore the formation of women’s subjectivity and desire in relation to social and material reality. In Alice Doesn’t: Feminism, Semiotics, Cinema (1984), de Lauretis develops the concept of experience as a process by which the subject is semiotically and historically constructed, arguing that one becomes a woman in and through the practice of signs in which women live. In The Practice of Love: Lesbian Sexuality and Perverse Desire (1994), she continues her exploration of these issues by focusing specifically on “perverse” formations of sexuality, by which she means forms of sexuality that challenge normative heterosexuality and especially lesbian sexuality. In each of these books, de Lauretis draws on the pragmatist semiosis of Peirce to explore the dynamic juncture between “inner” and “outer” worlds, private and public fantasies, and individual experience and social meaning, especially as they construct sexual subjects.

Semiotics is a term created by Peirce to “designate[s] the process by which a culture produces signs and/or attributes meanings of signs” (de Lauretis 1984, 167). Semiotics thus is a theory of how meaning is created through processes of interpretation. These processes are so important to Peirce that he goes so far as to claim, “my language is the sum total of myself; for the man [sic] is the thought” (Peirce 2000a, 67). This is not a reduction of the human to a narrowly construed language, however. Rather, the claim is that to understand who or what a person is, one must understand the processes of interpretation in which she and her various communities are engaged. This last point helps brings out the particularly pragmatist aspect of Peirce’s semiotics. For Peirce, the semiotic processes that constitute the individual are always grounded in community, history, and materiality. To understand the interpretative constitution of the self, one must understand the various “external” environments that contribute to it.

According to de Lauretis, an important reason to turn to Peirce is precisely that his theory returns body and history to the subject of semiosis.[3] For Peirce, semiosis is an unlimited process, but that does not mean that it is an infinite regression of signs merely circulating back on themselves. Rather, as de Lauretis explains, in their address to someone—and for Peirce, because they are inherently communal, signs always address someone—signs create other signs that are the “significate effects” of the first signs. Peirce calls these sign-effects “interpretants,” and the particular type of interpretant that interests de Lauretis is the one that Peirce calls “logical” because it takes up or makes sense of the emotion and energy of the other type of interpretants. The logical interpretant is a modification of a person’s habits, “habit” used pragmatically by Peirce to mean a tendency or disposition to a certain manner or style of acting. Thus for Peirce, although unlimited, semiosis nevertheless always results in the temporary “resting places” of one’s habits of acting and thinking—“temporary” because a person’s modified habits will contribute to the production of new signs, which will then feed into the on-going process of meaning-creation that will yet again modify subjects by producing additional habit changes. Thus on Peirce’s account—and this is of utmost importance to de Lauretis—signs have their effect in historical, bodily matter and are not narrowly linguistic.

De Lauretis faults Julia Kristeva for operating with just such a narrow (mis)understanding of the semiotic subject (1984, 171).[4] Representing one trend of poststructuralist semiotic theory for de Lauretis, Kristeva’s approach is at once valuable because of its psychoanalytic appreciation of the body and the unconscious, and problematic because of its narrow understanding of linguistics and thus its neglect of the social aspects of meaning-creation. The other trend of postructuralist semiotic theory, represented by Umberto Eco, appreciates the social side of semiosis but omits exactly what psychoanalysis includes: the non-conscious elements of human existence. A similar division, and thus a similar set of problems, can be found between the work of Freud and Foucault, according to de Lauretis. In his focus on sexuality, Freud offers a “privatized view of the internal world of the psyche” while Foucault’s account of sexuality is “eminently social” (1994, xix–xx). Thus, for de Lauretis, feminists who seek to understand the semiotic creation of sexual subjects are presented with a problematic choice built on an exclusive binary: either the sexual subject is socially constituted but lacks a psychic interior (Eco and Foucault) or the sexual subject has psychic depth but lacks rich connections with the world external to it (Kristeva and Freud).

Peirce’s advantage is that he attends to both sides of the internal-external divide, furnishing “the link between semiosis and reality, between signification and concrete action” (1984, 175). And yet, for de Lauretis, Peirce’s work is not sufficient by itself because it lacks a well-developed notion of the unconscious. Thus de Lauretis’s self-appointed task is to negotiate the problems and promises of all these approaches by means of a pragmatist semiotics, creating a “theoretical overlap” (1984, 168) between Kristeva’s internalist and Eco’s externalist semiotics, as well as between Freud’s privatized and Foucault’s social sexual subject. Put another way, de Lauretis joins Freud with Peirce—admittedly “even stranger bedfellows than Marx and Freud” (1984, 215 n31)—to explore how the semiotic junction between psychic interior and social exterior produces the unconscious habits that create sexual subjects.

In some of her most recent work (2000), de Lauretis makes clear that although semiosis is ongoing and although the habits it produces are always open to future changes, habit-change is not necessarily or always for the better nor can it easily (if at all) be controlled. In dialogue with Vincent Colapietro (2000) on how to understand Peirce’s logical interpretant, de Lauretis argues that it is very difficult, if not impossible, to deliberately direct the significate effects of semiosis. In her view here—which appears to diverge somewhat from her earlier emphasis on Foucault’s concepts of self-analysis and self-exercise as Peircean “‘deliberately formed, self-analyzing habit[s]’” (Peirce quoted in de Lauretis 1994, 312)—the juncture of psyche and social that takes root in unconscious habits is not amenable to conscious efforts to transform it. Rather than being deliberate and reflective, changes to habit tend to be random (at least from the point of rational consciousness) and are relentlessly subject to all sorts of deformations, compulsions, and other neurotic symptoms (2000, 172–73). The semiotic construction of sexual subjects thus can be seen as perverse not only in that it can defy heterosexual conventions but also in that it resists the efforts of self-knowledge and self-directed transformation.

5. The Reality of Racial Identities

Like gender and sexuality, race is a social-material category that is not simply given in nature. Scholars continue to debate precisely when modern notions of race were created, but since at least the late eighteenth century, general patterns of white privilege and supremacy and the domination of non-white people have existed. Given the oppressive origins of the concept of race and of whiteness in particular, it might seem that racial identity should be eliminated in the name of eliminating racism. And given that no definitive biological or genetic basis for dividing the human population into discreet racial groups exists, it might seem easy to eliminate racial identity since it is not real in the ways that it popularly is thought to be. But racial identities have a lived reality to them that is not dependent on scientific categorizations. Their lived reality not only makes it difficult to eliminate racial identities; it also makes it problematic to unequivocally call for their abolition since their elimination could mean the loss of an important source of meaning in one’s life.

Linda Martín Alcoff warns feminists and others of this potential loss, arguing that the reasons for eliminating class and status differences do not necessarily apply to racial and other social identities. In Visible Identities: Race, Gender, and the Self (2006), she examines race and gender as historical-material formations that are fundamental, rather than peripheral to the self. Analyzing philosophical and political critiques of identity politics, Alcoff explains how identity claims have become suspect because they are seen as necessarily divisive, exclusionary, and alienating. Appeals to racial and/or gender identities by Latinas, for example, allegedly are politically problematic because they intensify conflict between groups and thus are destructive to larger communities or nations (2006, 36). And they allegedly are philosophically problematic because they alienate a person from herself by means of an oppressive and artificially imposed category or set of categories (2006, 80). Genuine freedom and authenticity thus would seem to require the abandonment of social identities.

According to Alcoff, however, hidden behind these attacks on identity is a closet individualism that mistrusts any form of sociality or community and fears any influence of the Other on the self. “Why assume that if I am culturally, ethnically, sexually identifiable that this is a process akin to Kafka’s nightmarish torture machines in the penal colony?” asks Alcoff (2006, 81). The answer is that “identity in any form [is seen by its critics as] foisted on the self from the outside by the Other” (2006, 81). For the individual who insists on his or her absolute independence, social identities represent a loss of control and power through ontological dependency upon someone other than oneself. This loss of power is to be feared, and so too then are racial and other social identities to be resisted.

Alcoff’s responds to this fear by situating it as a very particular, rather than universal need to deflect the Other, one felt by colonizers and other dominant groups who do not want to see themselves reflected in their victims’ eyes (2006, 81). Antagonism and resistance are not the only forms that relationships between self and other can take. The interdependency of self and other can be recognized in such a way that “the Other’s view of me—that is, my identity in the Other’s presence—is internalized and thus is constitutive of my self” (2006, 82). Drawing on the hermeneutics of Hans-Georg Gadamer and the pragmatism of George Herbert Mead, Alcoff develops a concept of social identity that constitutively situates the individual in a communal world. Social identities are not forced onto atomistic individuals who then necessarily become alien to themselves. Racial and other identities are, borrowing from Gadamer, “hermeneutic horizons comprised of experiences, basic beliefs, and communal values, all of which influence our orientation toward and responses to future experiences” (2006, 287). Or in Mead’s terms, the self is formed in and through the context of the “generalized other,” which is a communal perspective by and through which an individual develops self-consciousness and thereby learns to perceive both herself and others (2006, 117). The hermeneutic notion of horizon allows feminists and others to appreciate how race and gender are real in that they are lived positions in which individual meaning is created in relationship to history and experience. An individual always operates within specific horizons, but because horizons open out to indeterminacy, a range of interpretative meaning is available from within those horizons (2006, 43). And Mead’s account of the social self enhances the notion of horizon by emphasizing its social dimensions (2006, 121). The horizon in and through which individual meaning is created is always a world of shared meaning that helps constitute an individual’s self-consciousness and experience.

For Alcoff, raced, gendered, and other social identities can be oppressive, but they are not inherently or necessarily so. The ultimate question, in her view, “is not how to overcome identity, but how to transform our current interpretations and understandings of [it]” (Alcoff 2006, 287). Shannon Sullivan asks a similar question about whiteness in Revealing Whiteness: The Unconscious Habits of Racial Privilege (2006). According to Sullivan, white privilege increasingly operates in the form of unconscious habit, able to thrive in a world that generally frowns on overt racism because that racism seems non-existent. With pragmatists W.E.B. Du Bois and John Dewey, Sullivan develops an account of whiteness as a raced and racist habit that is constitutive of the self and formed through transaction with a raced and racist world. Habit as such is not a problem to be solved although some habits, such as white privilege and domination, can be very harmful. For Sullivan, as a style or predisposition for engaging with/in the world, habit is simultaneously malleable and durable, which means that habits can be transformed but that such transformation tends to take a long time.

This especially true in the case of habits of white privilege, given their increasingly unconscious operations. Developing a pragmatized notion of the unconscious—one that is sympathetic to de Lauretis’s work on Peirce and Freud—Sullivan explains the unconscious as formed through transaction with its various social, political, material and other environments (2006, 47). Drawing on the psychoanalytic theory of Jean Laplanche, Sullivan also modifies the pragmatist concept of habit to account for the ways that habits of whiteness “often are deviously obstructionist, actively blocking the self’s attempts to transform itself for the better” (2006, 44). Racist habits of whiteness can be changed, but only indirectly, through changes to the environments that help constitute those habits. As Sullivan (2006, 10) argues, “relocating out of geographical, literary, political, and other environments that encourage the white solipsism of living as if only white people existed or mattered can be a powerful way of disrupting and transforming unconscious habits of white privilege.” And yet even here a word of warning is in order, according to Sullivan. Habits of white privilege can and often continue to operate in the midst of the best intentions to undermine them through control of one’s environments. Since habits of white privilege tend to be characterized by “ontological expansiveness,” in which white people treat all spaces as rightfully inhabited by them, attempts to master one’s environment in the name of anti-racist struggle simultaneously can be a reinforcement of that privilege (2006, 144). Sullivan thus cautions that although struggles to eliminate white privilege must continue, habits of racial privilege will not quickly or easily be eliminated.

6. Recent Scholarship and Future Directions

Compared to continental feminism, pragmatist feminism is a small field.[5] It is growing, however, and as it does so, the chances that more work on the intersections of feminism, pragmatism, and continental philosophy will be produced also increase. To date, one common thread that loosely unites feminist cross-fertilizations of continental and pragmatist philosophy is its criticism of oppositional, exclusionary binaries; another is a commitment to philosophical work that engages with lived experience and everyday life. In this closing section, we outline possible avenues for future work in pragmatist and continental feminism, and highlight recent developments in the field.

6.1 Bodies and Embodiment

For over two decades, understanding the relationship between embodiment and gender, race, and sexuality has been an important topic for continental feminists, especially Susan Bordo (1993), Judith Butler (1990 and 1994), Elizabeth Grosz (1994), and Gail Weiss (1999). In Living Across and Through Skins: Transactional Bodies, Pragmatism and Feminism (2001), Shannon Sullivan engages Butler’s and (to a lesser degree) Bordo’s work, along with that of Merleau-Ponty, Nietzsche, and Dewey, to argue for a feminist conception of bodily life as transactional. Sullivan presents bodies as dynamically constituted in and through relationships with their political, social, material, and other environments, and she does so for the purpose of exploring which bodies transactional processes benefit and harm and thus whether those processes should be embraced or transformed by feminists and others.

Ladelle McWhorter’s Bodies and Pleasures: Foucault and the Politics of Sexual Normalization (1999) does not explicitly appeal to pragmatist philosophy, but its affinities with pragmatist methods and concerns can be drawn out. McWhorter argues that the value of Foucault’s philosophy should not be judged by the truth (or falsity) of what it says, a method of evaluation that relies upon what Rorty (1979) calls “the mirror of nature.” In its place, McWhorter asks feminist and other readers of Foucault to pragmatically judge his work on what it does, that is, on the transformative impact that it has on their lives. Using her own life as a text, McWhorter “takes an experience of reading Foucault’s works as [her] point of analysis” (1999, xix) and demonstrates the feminist-friendly effects of Foucault’s particular account of bodies, pleasures, and the formation of sexual subjects.

Foucault also is the focal point of Cressida J. Heyes’s Self-Transformations: Foucault, Ethics, and Normalized Bodies (2007). As Heyes asks with Foucault how growth in a person’s capacities can be separated from increased docility within power relations, she draws on Richard Shusterman’s pragmatist somaesthetics. A bodily discipline that both critically studies and uses sensory-aesthetic appreciation to improve lived experience, somaesthetics can be a point of “counterattack” (2007, 123) that helps a person care for her embodied self in ways that increase her freedom. It does this by teaching non-normative ways of experiencing and evaluating one’s bodily experiences, increasing the capacity of what one can think and do. Through her concrete examples of yoga and other bodily practices, Heyes draws on continental and pragmatist philosophy to take “a first step toward creating grander feminist projects from existing somaesthetic practices” (2007, 136).

Marjorie Jolles, in contrast, doubts that Shusterman’s pragmatism can provide the critical counterpoint to bodily normalization that both Foucault and feminist philosophy need. This is because bodily experience is shaped by the very normalizing forces that it is supposed to challenge. Responding to Heyes in “Between Embodied Subjects and Objects: Narrative Somaesthetics” (2012), Jolles argues that “Shusterman does not go far enough in establishing somaesthetics’ suitability of Foucauldian feminist efforts to shape one’s life” in anti- and non-normative ways (2012, 307). Proposing an alternative to Shusterman’s somaesthetics, Jolles develops what she calls narrative somaesthetics. Modeled on feminist consciousness-raising, narrative somaesthetics incorporates into somatic practices narrative work that helps disrupt normalization. On Jolles’s view, by combining discursive and bodily practices, feminist philosophy will have a better shot at countering the harmful somatic effects of sexist oppression.

Pragmatist resources for thinking about embodiment also is the subject of Maurice Hamington’s (2004) Embodied Care: Jane Addams, Maurice Merleau-Ponty, and Feminist Ethics. In that book, Hamington argues that human bodies are built for care and that care can only be understood properly in conjunction with its embodied dimensions. Distinguishing care—a contextual, corporeal, interdependent way of being in the world—from the theory of care ethics, Hamington intersects Merleau-Ponty’s phenomenology of bodily habits with American pragmatist Jane Addams’ embodied practices of democracy and citizenship to demonstrate the body’s centrality to feminist ethics. Developing the concepts of caring habits, caring knowledge, and caring imagination, Hamington affirms Jane Addams’ “simple yet powerful mandate that we boldly experience one another” through our embodied practices of care (2004, 145).

Finally, some feminists emphasize the practical value of phenomenological and pragmatic accounts of embodiment and the self for solving specific problems in the real world. Jennifer Hansen, for example, in her contributions to the philosophy of psychiatry, has emphasized the therapeutic value of a conception of the habitual body and the narrative self for the treatment of individuals with bipolar disorder. Though such individuals may experience self-distrust as a result of difficulty with seeing themselves “as consistent agents” (2013, 69) brought on by challenges with identifying with their past actions in either manic or depressive states, Hansen argues that clinicians can assist patients build a coherent sense of self by incorporating insights about habitual embodiment. Drawing on Grosz and Iris M. Young’s (2005) feminist phenomenology, as well as James’s account of habit as central to embodied selfhood, Hansen suggests that the habitual body’s capacity to engage with the world in consistent, goal-directed ways, despite doing so unconsciously, provides an inroad to a self-concept that is coherent. Although such habitual moments (of, for example, opening familiar doors or performing special learned skills like CPR) are often performed unconsciously, we can begin to notice and appreciate them “if others, such as a clinician, points them out to us” (2013, 72.) Although such recognition may seem a small step, they could be useful as patients begin to cultivate self-trust. Clinicians, moreover, may assist patients in recognizing that even seemingly rudimentary habits have significance in creating a sense of self: “Although the habitual body of a bipolar patient may not have a habitual moral character, she may, for example, have a habit of recycling” (72). The recognition of such habits could be beneficial in beginning to build self-trust. Traditional views of psychiatry may view individuals with bipolar disorder as incapable of “coherent” selfhood in the ordinary sense of the word, but Hansen shows that feminist phenomenological and pragmatic “accounts of embodiment show another way in which bipolar selves can be coherent: they cohere in habitual bodies” (73).

6.2 The Concept of the Other

The concept of the Other offers a potential site for productive discussion and disagreement between feminist, pragmatist, and continental philosophers. As Charlene Haddock Seigfried notes, “[p]ragmatists tend to celebrate otherness by seeking out and welcoming difference as an expression of creative subjectivity” (1996, 267). The optimistic tone that pragmatism often takes toward alterity is markedly different from that of Julia Kristeva’s claim that one is always other to oneself: “Foreigner: a choked up rage deep down in my throat. By recognizing him within ourselves, we are spared detesting him in himself” (1991, 1). Contemporary pragmatist feminists have tended to be more skeptical than most canonical pragmatists of the category of the Other because they recognize it as a means of domination. Yet, influenced by pragmatism, those feminists tend not to construe the Other in as alienating and foreboding way as Kristeva does. Pragmatist and continental philosophy thus presents feminists with a variety of resources for thinking through the benefits and dangers of different conceptions of the Other, including the role of the Other in the constitution of both self and community.

Cynthia Gayman (2011) and Erin C. Tarver (2013), for example, have argued that women’s constitution as subjects in a social milieu of oppressive gender relations ironically opens the possibility for change and subversion. Tarver’s argument proceeds by bringing a Deweyan account of habit to bear on Judith Butler’s theory of gender as performative, whereas Gayman puts Dewey in dialog with Foucault. Specifically, Gayman combines a Foucaultian account of the gendered subject with a Deweyan insistence that critical investigation happens “by recognition of a problem, which in turn provokes the kind of reflexive activity leading to recognition that what is, does not have to be” (2011, 67). Because the individual is constituted through her interactions and transactions with others in the world, the recognition of problems necessarily occurs through everyday experiences and interactions. It is not that others are themselves problems; rather, the encounters in our world that cause us to stumble provoke us to ask questions about how to proceed. They, as Gayman puts it following Foucault and Colin Koopman (2011), provoke a “problematization” (67). Thus, for Gayman, although patterns of gender subordination that women encounter as they become subjects in and through interaction with others in the social world must be resisted, “to be resisted they must be seen, that is, recognized in the first place, which means they must be experienced , as well as problematized” (75). Encounter with the other, which happens necessarily through experience, is therefore necessary for the development of feminist consciousness.

6.3 Refiguring the Future: The Unconscious Imaginary

In psychoanalytic terms, the imaginary is the collection of (largely) unconscious fantasies and images that shapes both individual subjects and their worlds. In different ways, the work of both Donna Haraway and Luce Irigaray seeks to reveal the male privilege and domination contained within the current imaginary so that a space for a different sort of imaginary might be opened for the future. Although Irigaray is the better known for it, both she and Haraway appropriate the image of the speculum in this process, appealing to the gynecological mirror as an “instrument for rendering a part accessible to observation” (Haraway 1997, 197) and revealing how the feminine instrument is not itself reflected in its work of mirroring others (Irigaray 1985). While Haraway “excavate[s] something like a technoscientific unconscious” (1997, 151), Irigaray investigates the psychoanalytic “science that still cannot make up its mind” about “woman, science’s unknown” (1985, 15, 13). Their work thus offers interesting resources for uncovering a patriarchal culture’s blind spots and transforming its unconscious imaginary, as well as raises important questions about the role that science can or should play in feminist theorizing of the future.[6]

Noëlle McAfee also draws on psychoanalytic theory to analyze the unconscious operations of democratic societies. In Democracy and the Political Unconscious (2008), McAfee blends poststructural psychoanalysis, feminist philosophy, and semiotics with Deweyan, Rawlsian, and Habermasian democratic theories. The result is a sophisticated argument that when some members of a society are denied the ability to participate in the public sphere, that society will tend to develop a political unconscious. As McAfee explains, the political unconscious is not a thing or a place, but rather “an effect of processes: failures to sublimate well, desires unarticulated, voices kept silent, repressions reenacted without acknowledgement of their origins” (2008, 12). Understanding with Dewey that the public is called into being by particular problems and that it can have difficulty finding itself when those problems are immense, McAfee develops democratic strategies for public processes of mourning so that age-old traumas of repression and exclusion no longer are compulsively repeated.

6.4 The Epistemology of Resistance

Like McAfee, José Medina draws on several thinkers in both the continental and pragmatist traditions to argue for a feminist response to oppressive socio-political conditions. Unlike McAfee, however, Medina conceives the project of resistance to oppression as fundamentally epistemological in nature. The reason for this is that, as he argues in The Epistemology of Resistance (2013), while democratic practice requires collective engagement, “in contexts of sexual and racial oppression there are cognitive-affective deficits that amount to specific forms of epistemic insensitivity: the inability to listen to and learn from others, the inability to call into question one’s perspective and to process epistemic friction exerted from significantly different perspectives” (2013, 17–18). Such deficits undermine the possibility of genuine democratic engagement and prevent the privileged in particular of recognizing the socio-political injustices in which they are complicit. However, Medina’s epistemological project is both critical and constructive. Drawing especially on the work of Foucault and James, he articulates a vision of the epistemological practices we must take up in order to resist oppression, for “epistemic and sociopolitical melioration go hand in hand” (301).

Medina argues that knowers have a “shared responsibility with respect to epistemic justice for the correction of blind spots and social insensitivities associated with racism and (hetero)sexism” (2013, 25), suggesting that those subjects whose privilege prevents them from developing knowledge of or sensitivity to experiences beyond their own have an obligation to unsettle their epistemic ease by seeking out “epistemic friction” and “cultivat[ing] a resistant imagination” (26) that would sensitize them to the experiences of marginalized and stigmatized subjects. The prescription that Medina offers for accomplishing such cultivation, which he terms “guerilla pluralism” (284), is inspired by a combination of insights from Foucault and James. Both Foucault and James conceive truth and knowledge as plural and as the product of particular interests and purposes. One of the key ways in which they differ, however, is in the implications of this view of knowledge that they emphasize: whereas James offers a “melioristic pluralism,” in which epistemic contestations and negotiations are directed toward improving the objectivity of the different standpoints available, toward correcting their biases and mistakes, and toward “maintain[ing] their truth alive” (283), Foucault’s genealogical approach offers a less rosy view of the possibilities of epistemic melioration, and aims less at learning than unlearning received ways of viewing the world. Foucault, then, would have us “resurrect counter-memories, not just for the sake of joint cooperation, but for the sake of reactivating struggles and energizing forms of resistance” (284). Drawing from Foucault the importance of specific mechanisms to break down settled regimes of power/knowledge and from James the imperative to find a way to move forward in improving the social conditions in which we live, Medina advocates the formation of a resistant social imagination through genealogical investigations: “genealogical investigations constitute critical interventions in the social imagination that can help us make our sense of a shared past more pluralistic and open to diversity” (292). This is not to say, however, that the end point of such investigations will be the total overcoming of oppression or even of culpable shared ignorance. Rather, in a pragmatic vein, Medina emphasizes a fallibilist approach to investigation that remains open to correction and critique through “radical solidarity: the cultivation of an ever-expanding accountability and responsiveness to indefinitely many others, which is required by a resistant epistemic agency” (302). Such fallibilism, unlike radical relativism in which “any way of framing and interpreting is as good as any other,” is committed to producing a resistant imagination characterized by its exertion of “beneficial epistemic friction” (303) that is aimed at continual self-correction and resistance to oppression and the ignorance that necessarily accompanies it.

Celia T. Bardwell-Jones (2018) makes use of Medina’s epistemology of resistance to theorize the conflict between hospital administrators and Native Hawaiian mothers in policies regarding the treatment of the placenta after hospital births in Hawai’i. Before 2006, as Bardwell-Jones explains, hospitals regarded the placenta as hazardous human waste, which needed to be disposed of as a threat to public health. This put hospital policy in direct conflict with Native Hawaiian practice, which required burying the placenta in a ceremony after birth, as a means of affirming the connection of the infant with the environment and community from which they came. Because of the lasting legacy of colonialism in Hawai’i, this conflict was unhelpfully framed as a conflict between “modern” and “traditional” views of health (which, as Bardwell points out, ignores the fact that many Native Hawaiian mothers do in fact value modern hospitals and choose to give birth in them). The dominant biomedical view that barred taking home the placenta, moreover, relied “on an assumption of epistemological superiority” (106). Following Medina, Bardwell-Jones argues that this biomedical approach’s privileged position left it epistemically insensitive to Native Hawaiian knowledges about the moral value of a sense of place and community. To overcome such insensitivities, she suggests, hospital administrators should do as Medina says and aim to cultivate epistemic friction—or, as she puts its, “perplexity” (107)—by seeking out genuine engagement with differentially situated others. Doing so is useful not only for the purpose of adequately serving the community in which the hospital is located, but also for beginning to recognize when existing health care policy is in fact “informed by a state of moral panic” (110) that can surround public health discussions, but of which the medical establishment may very well be unaware.

6.5 Expanding the Canon

The expansion of the canon of “classical” American philosophy to include more than white men opens up new possibilities for feminist intersections of continental and pragmatist philosophy. Cynthia Willett’s The Soul of Justice: Social Bonds and Racial Hubris (2001) is a good example of one such possibility. In this book, Willett critically intersects G.W.F. Hegel and Luce Irigaray (among others) with the “visionary pragmatism” (2001, 175) of African-American thinkers such as Toni Morrison and Patricia Hill Collins to present an account of freedom based in social bonds. Rejecting modernity’s and psychoanalysis’s account of separation as crucial to the formation of subjectivity, Willet draws on accounts of slavery to show how the destruction of erotic connections through the violence of separation results in social death. With this account, Willett suggests how an expanded understanding of American pragmatism that includes black women can combine with continental philosophy to produce a feminist and anti-racist liberatory theory that appreciates the constitutive role that desire plays in social relationships. In recent years, additionally, Collins (2012; 2019) herself has written on the value of an explicit dialogue between intersectionality theory founded by women of color and classical pragmatist conceptions of community, writing that “each discourse speaks to gaps in the other” (2012, 444). Collins specifically argues that pragmatism offers intersectionality a means of forming a robust conceptualization of the relation between individuals and broader social structures, as well as a potential site of political action, whereas intersectionality offers pragmatists a framework for conceptualizing actually existing power relations, an explicit analytic of which pragmatism has historically lacked. The insights that emerge from this dialogue are of crucial significance to the anti-oppressive project: “to grow, intersectionality must become an intellectual leader. It is compelled to build something anew, drawing from knowledge projects such as Black feminist thought and American pragmatism without defining itself in opposition to them…commit[ting] to an open-ended process of creative social action, incorporating the ideas and actions of these and other knowledge projects into its own praxis” (2019, 188).

Willett continues to intersect continental, pragmatist, and feminist work in Irony in the Age of Empire: Comic Perspectives on Democracy and Freedom (2008). Willett’s ongoing interest in questions of freedom lead her to examine how it can be supported and encouraged by comedy, including social ridicule, satire, and carnivalesque laughter. As Willett ranges widely from philosophy to film and television to political tragedies, she draws on the tragicomic philosophy of Cornel West to develop an “augmented pragmatism, inflected fully by the comic spirit,” in order to “provid[e] the philosophical basis for reconceptualizing freedom” (2008, 16). Willett also puts Jean-Paul Sartre and Henri Bergson in conversation with Ralph Ellison and filmmaker Spike Lee to explore how satire can help nurture an emancipatory political ethics. The result is a feminist-infused account of democracy and freedom that appreciates the politically transformative possibilities of comedy.

In “How is This Paper Philosophy?” Kristie Dotson (2012) takes this expansion further. Dotson considers professional philosophy and its persistent failure to recruit women of color and other “diverse practitioners” (5), arguing that this failure is symptomatic of a “culture of justification” (6) in the discipline, which emphasizes legitimation and presumes the norms of that legitimation are univocal amongst all subjects. Dotson considers the testimony of black feminists and phenomenologists, including Donna-Dale Marcano (2010) and Gayle Salamon (2009) to highlight the feelings of “incongruence” (Dotson 2012, 13) that many diverse practitioners experience when confronted with these supposedly univocal norms, which often conflict with their lived experiences. In response, Dotson argues for the cultivation of “a culture of praxis,” in the discipline of philosophy, in which we value investigation of “issues and circumstances pertinent to our living,” recognizing that this will vary considerably depending on populations, as well as “recognition and encouragement of multiple canons and multiple ways of understanding disciplinary validation” (17). In so doing, Dotson argues, philosophy would thereby admit a diversity of concerns, methods, and canons, not for the sake of rendering all contributions equal, but for the sake of investigating which contributions might be “useful for some projects and irrelevant for others.” The upshot of such a cultivation would not only be to allow philosophy as a discipline to benefit from the ideas of diverse practitioners, but to make philosophy itself better able to present “livable options” (26) to those practitioners, and to black women in particular.

6.6 The Limits of Feminist Intersections of Pragmatist and Continental Philosophy

One of the effects of Nancy Fraser’s work in social and political philosophy and critical theory has been to raise questions about the benefit to feminists of drawing upon certain strands of continental philosophy. For example, Fraser finds value in the theories of thinkers such as Foucault, Bourdieu, and Habermas (among others) because their notions of discourse include a rich array of historically embedded social practices (1997, 151–152). By contrast, Fraser claims that “feminists should have no truck with the versions of discourse theory that they attribute to [Jacques] Lacan [and] only the most minimal truck with related theories attributed to Julia Kristeva” (1997, 151). This is because Fraser views Lacan and Kristeva as reducing the variety of forms of human communication to language narrowly understood as a symbolic system. Given the variety of continental theories that feminists might engage, Fraser argues that what is needed is a “pragmatics model” (1997, 155). Also called “neo-pragmatism” by Fraser (in Benhabib, et al. 1995, 167), such a model would allow feminists to separate the wheat from the chaff in continental philosophy and incorporate the best it has to offer into feminist theory (1997, 208). Fraser thus uses pragmatism as a method by which to discriminate between different continental theories, and in so doing, raises the broader question of the relative advantages and disadvantages for feminism of intersecting pragmatist and continental philosophy.

Similarly, Erin C. Tarver has argued that pragmatists should be wary of importing James’s views wholesale, and on the contrary, that elements of James’s philosophy that presuppose a masculine subject or a too-robust vision of individual autonomy must be “recognized and rejected” (2015, 99). The reason for this is that such presuppositions are often not merely sexist, but have profound ontological and ethical implications that would further entrench anti-feminist social hierarchies. Yet, Tarver frames this willingness to revise or selectively draw from certain elements of James’s thought as consistent with pragmatic fallibilism. She writes, “We must be willing to take James’s fallibilism and deference to new evidence seriously enough to apply it to his own works” (100) rather than dismissing masculine language and assumptions as regrettable instances of sexism that can be overlooked as the product of another time. Thus, according to Tarver, feminist philosophical engagement with pragmatism must be willing to critique and reject, even when engaging with thinkers whose ideas can be useful for feminist aims.

This list of possible topics in the area of feminist intersections of pragmatist and continental philosophy certainly is not comprehensive, nor are the possibilities contained within it fully fleshed out. That work awaits others interested in this new field. The forms that it will take remain to be seen and are eagerly awaited.

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