Modal Fictionalism

First published Tue May 14, 2002; substantive revision Tue Mar 10, 2020

Questions about necessity (or what has to be, or what cannot be otherwise) and possibility (or what can be, or what could be otherwise) are questions about modality. Fictionalism is an approach to theoretical matters in a given area which treats the claims in that area as being in some sense analogous to fictional claims: claims we do not literally accept at face value, but which we nevertheless think serve some useful function. However, despite its name, “Modal Fictionalism” in its usual manifestations is not primarily fictionalism about claims of necessity and possibility, but rather a fictionalist approach to claims about possible worlds. (For instance, modal fictionalism is not normally fictionalist about the claim that “it is possible that there be a species of tail-less kangaroo”, but rather about the claim that “there is a possible world in which there is a species of tail-less kangaroo”.) The practice of taking possible worlds to be merely convenient fictions, or of treating talk about possible worlds as being useful without being literally correct, is quite common in philosophical circles. It is only recently, however, that philosophers have seriously examined the implications of taking possible worlds to be merely fictional objects, like Sherlock Holmes or a frictionless surface.

Theories employing possible worlds terminology have been found to be very useful in philosophy, e.g. when engaging in thought experiments; distinguishing various claims in metaphysics, or in the philosophy of language, mind, knowledge or ethics; and in areas other than philosophy, like linguistics, modal logic, and probability theory. Many have found the status of these worlds and their contents to be puzzling, to say the least. What are they? Where, if anywhere, are they supposed to be? How are we supposed to discover facts about them? Isn’t it extravagant to believe that just because a situation is possible, it must in some sense exist? Modal fictionalists take theories committed to the existence of possible worlds, merely hypothetical situations, non-actual but possible objects etc. to be strictly and literally false, and so they avoid the problems of believing in possible worlds. Nevertheless, they claim, they can enjoy the benefits of using these seemingly problematic theories.

Modal fictionalism should be of interest to those concerned with the metaphysics of modality, since theories committed to the literal existence of possible worlds (and, even more worryingly, the literal existence of merely possible objects ‘contained’ in these worlds) come at a cost, both to economy and to many people’s intuitions. But it is, or should be, of wider interest as well, since it is one of the most discussed applications of a fictionalist treatment of abstract objects, along with mathematical fictionalism. Lessons learned in the case of modal fictionalism can hopefully be applied to other areas in which we may wish to evade literal theoretical commitments. Modal fictionalism continues to be an active topic of research and debate, and as well as dozens of papers supporting or criticising modal fictionalism, there is even a published monograph on the topic (Warzoszczak 2014).

I shall begin by discussing the motivation for modal fictionalism, and distinguishing some of its varieties. Next, I shall discuss what connection there might be between “fictionalism” and treatments of paradigmatic fictions. I shall then discuss the debate about the “Brock/Rosen objection” and a problem raised by Bob Hale, both of which turn on technical problems concerning modal claims about the status of the modal fiction. Finally, in section 4, other concerns about modal fictionalism will be discussed.

1. Types of Modal Fictionalism

Modal fictionalists often focus on the claim that possible worlds are merely fictional entities, and apparent commitment to possible worlds is to be explained in the same sort of way that apparent commitment to ideal gases or frictionless surfaces is to be explained. Rosen 1990 and others have formulated modal fictionalism as a theory that takes talk of possible worlds to be on a par with talk about paradigmatically fictional objects, e.g., Sherlock Holmes (“There is a (non-actual) possible world at which there are blue swans” is to be understood on the model of “There is a brilliant detective at 221b Baker Street”, in Rosen’s example). This goes with an at least partial account of how we are to treat paradigmatically fictional claims: that they are, literally and strictly speaking, false. The literal truth, according to modal fictionalists, is that there are no merely possible worlds (or merely possible situations, or outcomes), and there are no merely possible objects. Strictly and literally speaking, there is no sculpture that I spent this morning making, though there could have been. When the flipped coin comes down heads, there is strictly speaking no outcome of that very throw in which it comes down tails.

What is literally true, however, is that according to the modal fiction, or according to the fiction of possible worlds there is a (merely possible) sculpture I could have spent this morning making, and there is an (unactualised) outcome of the toss in which the coin came down tails. What is said in talk about merely possible worlds and merely possible objects is generally literally false, but the slightly more longwinded talk about what is true according to the fiction of possible worlds is literally true. One might think (as Hinckfuss 1993 does) that talk about possible worlds is (or should be) governed by implicit presuppositions known to be false so that what is said in the language of possible worlds does not commit one to the existence of possible worlds, but only to some more economical proposition: something of the kind “if there were possible worlds of such-and-such a sort, then …”, or “given the presupposition that there are possible worlds, …”. Or you might have some other account of the functioning of talk about possible worlds: Nolt 1986 suggests we should take typical “possibilistic discourse” to be a game of make-believe (Nolt 1986, p. 440), and while Nolt does not tell us specifically what theory of make-believe he has in mind, there are many theories of make-believe (most famously Walton 1990) that might be employed by a modal fictionalist to explain the behaviour of our typical utterances about possible worlds.  Stephen Yablo (Yablo 1996) is one person who employs Walton’s theory in his fictionalism (or, as he prefers in Yablo 2001, figuralism) about possible worlds.

The main benefit which a fictional approach to possible worlds offers is, of course, the advantage of using the language of possible worlds, without the stiff ontological cost of literal commitment to such worlds. It is an especially tempting account of merely possible objects (like blue swans, or dragons, or the Holy New Zealand Empire): even those who accept some abstractionist account of possible worlds (see van Inwagen 1986) might well be reluctant to accept the literal existence of their contents. After all, it is often thought that the distinguishing mark of merely possible objects is that they do not actually exist.

Central to fictionalist treatments of possible worlds are biconditionals connecting truths about necessity and possibility, on the one hand, and the contents of the modal fiction, on the other. Central biconditionals will be all the instances of the following schemas (where P expresses a proposition):

Possibly P iff according to the fiction of possible worlds, P is true at some possible world.

Necessarily P iff according to the fiction of possible worlds, P is true at all possible worlds.

Either schema will be adequate to yield the other, given the standard inter-definition of possibility and necessity, provided enough logical machinery is available for reasoning within the scope of the “according to the fiction” operator. As a matter of fact, the above is a simplification, since, according to Rosen (1990, p. 335), what is true according to the fiction of possible worlds may be only a proposition connected with P: the paraphrase of P into the language of possible worlds. In general, for Rosen, this will be the analysis of P in Lewis’s theory of possible worlds. Rosen states the form of the fictionalist biconditionals at its most general as:

P iff according to PW, P*.

where “PW” is the fiction of possible worlds, P is any proposition, and P* is its possible-worlds “paraphrase” (Rosen 1990, p. 335). In simple cases the above biconditionals will do as they are: for example,

Possibly, pigs fly iff according to the fiction of possible worlds (or according to PW), at some possible world, pigs fly.

In less straightforward cases, however, the proposition expressed by P* may have to differ from that expressed by P.[1] Fictionalists may also employ other biconditionals when constructing their fiction — one example is a biconditional to ensure that every proposition that is (really) true is according to the fiction true in the actual world.[2] A modal fiction may require more contents than those yielded by such biconditionals: what other contents the fiction of possible worlds might contain is an important question, and one unsurprisingly which different modal fictionalists will answer differently.

1.1 The Contents of The Fiction of Possible Worlds

Many fictionalists are far from explicit about exactly what the content of the fiction of possible worlds is to be. (Often they are also silent on the pressing issue of how one would justify one fiction rather than another: but more on this in section 4). Two explicit proposals were made in 1989 and 1990 about which fiction to use. Gideon Rosen’s 1990 proposed using a slightly modified version of David Lewis’s 1986 theory of possible worlds as the modal fiction. The theory had been proposed by Lewis as the literal truth, but by treating it as a mere fiction Rosen provided a ready-made story about possible worlds, their extent and nature. The other proposal was that of D.M. Armstrong’s 1989. Armstrong proposed a “two-step” fiction, according to which there was a “great fiction”, which asserted the existence of a lot of “little fictions”, each of which completely described a possible world. Armstrong resisted identifying these complete descriptions of ways things could be with the possible worlds, as an abstractionist might, since Armstrong believed that worlds are supposed to be objects like our cosmos, rather than descriptions, properties, or other such abstract objects. Armstrong employed the two stage fiction, on the other hand, because he held that it is true at each world that it is the only world, and if the fiction were of a Lewisian pluriverse each world would (according to the fiction) be such that it was one of many worlds. In this respect, though Armstrong spells out the concern in quite a different manner, it can be seen as an anticipation of the Brock/Rosen objection (see section 3, below). In both the theories of Armstrong and Rosen the “worlds” in the story are thought to be ‘concrete’ cosmoi, like our own.[3]

A third systematic attempt to specify something like a modal fiction is worth noting here. Theodore Sider defends an “ersatz pluriverse” view in Sider 2002, according to which possible worlds talk should be understood as talk about what is true according to what is true according to a pluriverse sentence that Sider specifies. Sider constructs this sentence, that simultaneously describes all the possible worlds and their relationships, using a range of constraints including the constraint that de dicto necessity claims that are in fact true are true of all the worlds of the described pluriverse. Sider distinguishes his view from Rosen-style modal fictionalism, particularly because Sider thinks that the “according to” he needs should not be understood as the sort of “according to the fiction” operator he takes Rosen’s to be. So while Sider’s view probably should not be classed as a variety of modal fictionalism, it is a close cousin. Berit Brogaard argues that Sider’s view is inferior to her preferred form of modal fictionalism in Brogaard 2006.

For any set of principles governing the fiction of possible worlds, the question obviously arises as to why that set should be chosen. Alternatively, there are many stories we could tell about other worlds (whether they are cosmoi or fictional abstract objects), and the question arises as to why one rather than any other be chosen to be the modal fiction. (One could of course be more pluralist than this, and allow that different fictions are suitable for different purposes. The relativised question may still be asked, however: why this fiction, rather than any other, for this particular purpose?). This task of selecting and justifying one or more particular stories about worlds will be one of the challenges discussed in section 4. However, the next distinction to be discussed makes a big difference to what sort of answer to this question will be acceptable.

1.2 Strong vs. Timid

This next distinction concerns the role the modal fiction is to play in the theory. Is the fiction of possible worlds intended to provide an explanation of the applicability modal vocabulary, or not? The view that the truth of modal claims depends on, or is to be explained by, the contents of the fiction of possible worlds is often called “strong modal fictionalism”, following Rosen’s description of such a view (Rosen 1990, p. 354, Nolan 1997a). The view that modal truth does not depend on the contents of the modal fiction (and usually, that what the contents of the modal fiction are depends on the modal truth), on the other hand, is known as “timid modal fictionalism”, again following Rosen (Rosen 1990, p. 354).

Both the view put forward by Armstrong 1989 and the primary view discussed (but not endorsed) by Rosen 1990 seem to have been fictionalisms of the ‘strong’ kind (see Nolan 1997a, p. 263). ‘Timid’ fictionalism about possible worlds is also mentioned by Rosen 1990, and has been endorsed in passing by Field (1989, p. 41, 86). Sider 2002 is also on the ‘timid’ side, not seeking an analysis at least of basic de dicto necessity. A modal fictionalist theory which sees the fiction of possible worlds as providing the resources for an analysis of modal statements would of course do important theoretical work: since the analysis of claims involving modal operators is among the most controversial and difficult issues in metaphysics. The downside is that strong modal fictionalism seems to face serious objections: see section 4.

Apart from any objections that might be leveled at strong modal fictionalism, the advocate of this variety of modal fictionalism faces the challenge of stating the contents of the modal fiction without relying on modal notions in a way that would make the explanation of those modal notions circular. Since the fiction explains the truth of modal claims, explaining the content of the modal fiction by reference to modal claims would be circular (e.g., by stipulating that all of the propositions which are necessary hold in all worlds, or that objects have in all worlds in which they exist the properties which they in fact have essentially). Stating, in non-modal terms, general principles about possible worlds that would enable one to determine, when presented with a proposition, whether it holds at all worlds, at some but not others, or none, is a difficult and controversial matter. Plausibly, a strong modal fictionalist will owe us such a non-modal specification of the contents of the modal fiction, if our understanding of the contents of the modal fiction is to allow us a useful method of assessing the truth of modal claims. Furthermore the strong modal fictionalist seems committed to there being a fact of the matter about the content of the modal fiction which is not itself to be explained or analysed in terms of further modal facts of the matter.

One particularly pressing instance of this difficulty (noted e.g., by Rosen 1990, p. 344) is the problem of how to understand the “according to the fiction of possible worlds…” operator. Natural initial glosses, as Rosen points out, include:

If PW were true, then P would be true; If we suppose PW, P follows; It would be impossible for PW to be true without P being true as well. (Rosen 1990, p. 344)

The problem is that these seem modal. Rosen offers several possible responses the fictionalist could make to this problem. He could admit that his theory does indeed contain a modal primitive, but claim nevertheless that it is some sort of advance in analysis, reducing all modal primitives to one. (Though as Rosen says, “According to the fiction of possible worlds” seems like a very odd primitive.) Or he could instead attempt to spell out the prefix in a non-modal way. This has not to date been attempted by many avowed modal fictionalists, but is one of the many tasks facing a modal fictionalist who sees the invocation of the fiction as the method for analysing or explaining modality.

If the modal fictionalist were only timid, on the other hand, then the fictionalist biconditional could be used to generate a great deal of the content of the modal fiction: whether or not the fiction claims that a given proposition is true in all possible worlds (or all accessible worlds) depends on whether that proposition is indeed necessarily true; whether or not a proposition is true at some world (or some accessible world) depends on whether it is possibly true; and so on. Furthermore, an analysis of truth in fiction in terms of some modal notion (whether a counterfactual conditional, strict implication, or whatever) would not make the account circular, since analysing modal discourse would be no part of the purpose of the fictional machinery. One recent worked-out modal fictionalist approach which explicitly analyses the relevant “according to the modal fiction” operator in terms of modal operators is Divers 1999b. Among other benefits, Divers argues that this sort of definition enables one to prove a “modal safety result”: that when we have two modal claims A and B, and we have the possible-worlds-analogues of the two modal claims (call them A* and B* respectively), “Necessarily, if B* is a consequence of A* then B is a consequence of A” (Divers 1999b, p. 330). Such a safety result would be welcome, for it would provide the guarantee we needed that “detouring” in our reasoning through claims like A* and B* would not lead us astray when trying to determine whether B followed from A.

A drawback of timid modal fictionalism is that it leaves the important issue of a theory of modality to one side. Without some other positive story, even if it were primitivism about modality, it might seem that it would be difficult to motivate timid fictionalism over agnosticism about the status of possible worlds. In this context, the agnostic option would be to accept that the story of possible worlds is at least a useful fiction, but for all we know it may be that some theory that explains possibility in terms of possible worlds is true as well. Many of the leading candidates for the analysis of modal claims are those that explain the truth of modal claims in terms of the literal existence and nature of possible worlds, so without a positive alternative story, it might seem premature to reject this style of explanation of modality. However, the project of endorsing fictionalism about possible worlds and possible objects without endorsing the further claim that this fiction provides the material to explain or analyse our modal notions, while in some ways less philosophically interesting than its strong cousin, is proportionally less open to serious objections.

1.3 Normative vs. Descriptive

Modal fictionalism can be interpreted as a descriptive theory of what our talk in fact amounts to, or as a normative proposal for how we should use talk of possible worlds. (In the terminology of Burgess and Rosen 1997, this is the distinction between a “hermeneutic” construal of modal fictionalism and a “revolutionary” construal of modal fictionalism). If the theory is that in fact we take possible worlds to be no more than convenient fictions, and, in the case of strong modal fictionalism, that facts about the content and nature of the fiction of possible worlds explain and/or provide the basis of the analysis of our modal locutions, then the theory is descriptive. This sociological claim that most philosophers who talk about possible worlds take this talk to be analogous to talk of e.g., ideal gases is a dubious one: my own impression is that modal fictionalism is a minority view amongst those philosophers who work extensively on the philosophy of possible worlds and its applications, though perhaps fictionalism might be the majority view when all who have opinions on possible worlds are taken into account.

In any case, fictionalism about possible worlds might be important even if the descriptive version is incorrect. A normative claim to the effect that talk of possible worlds ought to be interpreted as merely fictional discourse, or the corresponding strong fictionalist claim that modal statements ought to be reinterpreted so as to be explained or analysed as statements about the content of the fiction of possible worlds, might be found attractive even if it were conceded that most people who employed the discourse were not talking fictively, or that the actual commitments of the folk and most philosophers who employ everyday modal idiom are to be cashed out in some other way (e.g., as implicit commitment to some false theory, perhaps one which took modal statements to have truth conditions in terms of an objective modal reality).

The two questions, of whether the fictionalist theory is supposed to describe our current practice, and whether it is supposed to describe a practice we should adopt instead of realism, are independent. Two people could agree that normal usage of possible-worlds talk is not intended literally, but disagree about whether we should accept the literal existence of possible worlds (that is, they could be descriptive fictionalists while disagreeing about the normative question), and likewise two people could be normative fictionalists, and claim that we should take ordinary possible worlds talk as being only fictionally true or appropriate, while disagreeing about whether in fact current usage reflects this fictionalism or instead reveals non-fictionalist commitments among the users of the vocabulary. (This independence may be overlooked if we employ Burgess and Rosen’s vocabulary, which suggests that fictionalists face a binary choice of a “hermeneutic” fictionalist approach or a “revisionary” approach.)

Unfortunately, modal fictionalists have often not been explicit about whether their theory is to be an analysis of the possible-worlds talk and perhaps modal discourse which is actually employed, or a normative suggestion about how we might move to a superior theory. It is to be hoped that those seeking to provide a fully worked out modal fictionalist position would make more explicit the status of their proposal.

1.4 Fictionalism about Modality and Modal Fictionalism

So far, it has been taken for granted that the modal fictionalist treats ordinary modal claims as sometimes literally true, and it is only claims about possible worlds and their contents which the modal fictionalist will wish to claim are literally false, but true according to a story. A more radical modal fictionalism is possible: one in which modal claims themselves (such as the claim that there could have been blue swans, or that necessarily, everything is self-identical) are not literally true, but only true according to a fiction. (In Nolan 1997a I called a version of modal fictionalism which took both claims about possible worlds and modal claims to be true only according to fictions broad modal fictionalism.)

Such extended fictionalism about modality could, I think, come in two main varieties. One would maintain that modal operators (and associated pieces of language like essential predication, counterfactual conditionals, and perhaps other things like assignments of probabilities) lacked literal application: that all statements prefixed with a modal operator were either uniformly literally truthvalueless or uniformly literally false. This faces several immediate formal difficulties, given the usual characterisation of the modal operators.[4]

A less blanket rejection of modality might only insist on the falsehood of some modal claims: think of the analogy of a moral nihilist who rejects only “positive” moral claims, such as that taking property without permission is wrong, or that it is good to help the ill, but accepts that it is not wrong to take property without permission (since nothing is wrong) and that it is not good to help the ill (since nothing is good). This fictionalist about modality might reject the literal truth of all claims about necessity, for example (and, in virtue of the interdefinition, accept the literal truth of all possibility claims). Or she might assert as little as is needed to preserve the basic modal inferences from actuality: for example, every true P is possibly true, and actually true, but this is the limit of literal modal truth. This would be more analogous to the fictionalist about possible worlds who nevertheless thinks that there is one possible world — the actual, and one collection of possible objects — the actual objects.

Fictionalism of this sort extending to modal discourse as well should be a position worthy of investigation by those attracted to fictionalist strategies and mistrustful of modality. Since it seems to lack contemporary advocates, however, it shall not be dwelled upon here.[5]

1.5 Further Extensions

Modal fictionalism has traditionally been conceived as fictionalism about possible worlds, and implicitly also about their contents. One natural way to extend modal fictionalism so understood is to admit impossible worlds as well. Use of a fiction of impossible worlds is unlikely to seem too extravagant for many modal fictionalists, but it might also provide a mechanism for non-fictionalists about possible worlds to talk of impossible worlds without the extra theoretical costs they fear. So there is a partially fictionalist option of being a realist of some stripe about possible worlds but a fictionalist about impossible worlds (and perhaps other situations, e.g., incomplete or underdetermined ones). This partial fictionalism will face some of the same sorts of questions, and employ the same sorts of strategies, as modal fictionalism about possible worlds.

Another mixed strategy is rarely explicitly endorsed, though it may be implicit in many theorists’ talk. By far the majority of realists about possible worlds take them to be abstract objects of some sort: sets of sentences or propositions, uninstantiated world-properties, unactualised maximal facts, or perhaps even as sui generis simples. However, their approach to merely possible objects is often less explicitly spelled out. As well as possible worlds, merely possible objects such as blue swans, my counterparts, Newtonian masses, XYZ, and many others are discussed and quantified over. Some abstractionists will wish to identify such merely possible objects with actual abstract objects — perhaps uninstantiated properties that are less than world-properties, descriptions of parts of worlds, set-theoretic representatives, or whatever. But many more will not. This is for at least three reasons. The first is the intuition, never entirely quelled, that a merely possible blue swan should be blue and a swan. Abstract objects are rarely, if ever, either. The second is that it is often thought that the whole point about merely possible objects is that they do not exist, but might have. Admitting their literal existence by identifying them with actual existing abstract objects will go against the grain for many. Finally, many theories of possible worlds lack obvious candidates to play the roles of merely possible objects. This is most obvious for those theories that take possible worlds to be simples, but it is also not straightforward to divide a set of propositions into “object shaped” components, or to distinguish one merely possible object from its duplicates if one identifies worlds with world-properties, and furthermore seeks to divide these up to yield merely possible less-than-world-sized objects. Fictionalism about merely possible objects is an underappreciated theory, and should perhaps recommend itself to more abstractionists about possible worlds than it in fact does.

2. Fictionalism in Context

2.1 Modal Fictionalism and Fiction

A theory that holds that possible worlds are to be treated as having the status of fictional objects immediately gives rise to questions about the status of fictions and fictional objects more generally. The issue of how to understand the “according to the fiction…” operator has already been mentioned. Other issues in the treatment of fiction are the question of whether “theoretical” fictions are to be seen in the same light as literary fictions, and the question of what ontological status fictions possess.

There is room in principle to distinguish claims about paradigmatically fictional characters (like Sherlock Holmes or hobbits) from the treatment one wishes to apply to claims which serve useful theoretical purposes but which are not to be taken literally, or at least not at face value: to distinguish “fabulous” and “fictional” entities, to use Bentham’s not entirely perspicuous terminology (Bentham 1959). One might wish to do this, for example, if one thought that paradigmatic story-telling consisted of utterances that were not truth-apt (not anyway through the same mechanism as ordinary utterances), while claims about, say, ideal gases were better construed as standard sorts of assertions that were literally false. In practice, however, recent modal fictionalism discussions have proceeded as if the theory holds that possible worlds are fictional in the fullest sense of the word.

The ontological status of fictions is an important issue to settle if we are to determine whether modal fictionalism is any advance metaphysically on rival realist theories of possible worlds. On pain of circularity, the ontology of fiction, as conceived by the fictionalist, had best not include possible worlds (as the ontology of fiction offered in Lewis 1978 does), but there are other sources of concern. Rosen points out that fictionalists must believe in fictions, stories, theories, or somesuch, and that if these are construed as abstract objects, they will not be philosophically uncontroversial (Rosen 1990, p. 338). Rosen argues that belief in abstract objects like stories and theories is less revisionary than belief in Lewisian possible worlds, at least. However, it is hardly clear that an ontology of abstract representational entities is any more or less objectionable than the ontology of abstractionist theories of possible worlds. (Lycan 1993, p. 16, Nolan 1997a, pp. 271–273). Alternatively, fictionalists could commit themselves to more concrete, “nominalistically respectable” fictions only: the relevant fictions or theories of possible worlds might be conceived of only as ink-marks on pieces of paper, or information states inside brains, or perhaps as some amalgam of these and other actual, concrete ontology. This approach is not problem-free either (see section 4): it is far from clear that it will serve as a basis for paradigm fictions, let alone be enough to explain possible worlds.

3. Technical Problems

There are a variety of technical objections to modal fictionalism, and if these objections succeeded they would derail specific proposals like that of Rosen 1990 and perhaps cause difficulties for modal fictionalism in general. The most discussed of these objections is the Brock/Rosen objection, an objection to the theory of Rosen 1990, published independently in Brock 1993 and Rosen 1993. (In the case of Rosen 1993, a variety was also leveled at the fictionalism of Armstrong 1989).

3.1 The Brock/Rosen Objection

The reader is advised to consult Brock 1993 and Rosen 1993 for an exact statement of their objections, but in essence the problem arises when we consider the modal status of certain claims about possible worlds themselves. One of the principal fictionalist biconditionals, as we have seen, is the biconditional connecting necessary truths and what the fiction asserts about all possible worlds:

Necessarily P iff, according to the modal fiction, at all worlds, P*,

where P* is the possible-worlds paraphrase of P. According to the fiction employed by Rosen 1990 (i.e. the theory which David Lewis offers as fact), there are many co-existing concrete possible worlds — each one its own cosmos. Furthermore, this claim is true at any of these possible worlds. So, according to the modal fiction, at all worlds it is true that there are many other possible worlds. However, it follows from the biconditional that since, according to the modal fiction, at all worlds, there are many possible worlds, it follows that necessarily, there are many possible worlds. Since necessarily P implies P, it follows that there are (literally!) many possible worlds. But the whole point of modal fictionalism was to deny (or at least avoid asserting) that there were many possible worlds. So modal fictionalism, at least of the variety described, is self-refuting.

So the objection goes. (The version presented above is Brock’s from Brock 1993 — for some of the detail of Rosen’s argument, see below or Rosen 1993.) Two direct responses have been offered to this problem in the literature. The first, by Peter Menzies and Philip Pettit (Menzies and Pettit 1994), conceded that the objection “is decisive against the letter of the Rosen proposal” (p. 29), and sought to provide modified fictionalist biconditionals to produce a modal fictionalist theory which would not be susceptible to the Brock/Rosen objection. Nolan and O’Leary-Hawthorne 1996 produced a version of the Brock/Rosen objection which they believed circumvented the Menzies and Pettit solution offered in section 3 of Menzies and Pettit’s paper. Section 5 of Menzies and Pettit gave another translation scheme meant to avoid the Brock/Rosen objection; it is argued in the following supplementary document that this scheme too is unsatisfactory.

[A Persisting Problem For Fictionalism About Possible Worlds]

I shall not dwell on the details of the Menzies/Pettit position, since the other response to the Brock/Rosen objection has been more influential: the response of Noonan 1994. Noonan claims that the Brock/Rosen objection is not even successful against the letter of the original proposal in Rosen 1990 (Noonan 1994, p. 133). He argues that careful attention to the procedures actually given by Lewis (Lewis 1968) for paraphrasing modal claims into claims in the language of possible worlds will show that “according to the fiction of possible worlds, at any world, there are many worlds” will not be able to be derived, and so the move to “necessarily, there are many worlds” cannot be carried through. Thus if fictionalists stick closely to the possible-worlds “translations” given in Lewis 1968, they will be able to avoid the threatened collapse.

The way the Brock/Rosen objection is raised by Rosen begins with an apparently harmless statement of contingency: (numbering of claims are Rosen’s, and while Brock and Rosen’s presentations are reasonably informal, the formal translations are given by Noonan, and his numberings for those are provided)

(2) Necessarily, it is contingent whether kangaroos exist

or to put it in formal modal logic (Kx = x is a kangaroo):

□ (◊∃xKx & ◊¬∃xKx)

From this, Rosen claims, the “standard analysis” delivers:

(3) At all worlds, there are worlds where kangaroos exist and worlds where they don’t.

Ignoring for our purposes the complications which need to be introduced if we are to add accessibility relations between worlds, the Lewis 1968 equivalent of (2) is

(3L) ∀w(Ww→ ∃w′(Ww′ & ∃x(Ixw′ & Kx)) & ∃w″(Ww″ & ¬∃x(Ixw″ & Kx))))

Noonan points out that this formula does not imply

(4L) ∀w(Ww→ ∃w′(Ww′ & Iw′w & ∃w″(Ww″ & Iw″w & ¬w′=w″)))

which is the formula required in Lewis 1968 to be able to move back to “necessarily, there are two worlds”, and which is the formula Brock and Rosen would need to derive if they were to show that Rosen’s (2) (or Brock’s equivalent) led the modal fictionalist to have to say that there are literally several worlds. The reason why (3L) does not imply (4L) is that it is not enough for there to be two worlds at a given world (V, let us call it) that there be existential quantification over two worlds within the scope of an existential quantifier committing us to V: the two worlds must also be “in” V, in the sense that the two place predicate “I” must hold between V and each of the worlds. This is what happens in (4L), but it does not happen in (3L), where there are two existential quantifiers over worlds in the scope of the outside universal quantifier, but where the worlds existentially quantified over are not asserted to be “in” any of the worlds w.

Rosen 1995 has accepted Noonan’s resolution of the problem apparently posed by the Brock/Rosen objection. Rosen has thus changed his preferred proposal, so that instead of a general endorsement of the position outlined by Lewis 1986, Rosen’s recommendation for modal fictionalists now relies more heavily on Lewis 1968. Instead of the simpler biconditionals discussed near the beginning of this entry and in Rosen 1990, the revised proposal is to take equivalences asserted by Lewis 1968 between modal claims and claims couched in terms of quantification over possible worlds, and treat those equivalences instead as specifying connections between modal statements and claims about what is true according to the fiction. If a modal claim is literally true, its associated world-claim is true according to the fiction, and vice versa.

So the state of play seems to be this: while the Brock/Rosen style objection remains something for a modal fictionalist to be wary of when constructing the fiction of possible worlds, it is possible to avoid the objection by being suitably careful about what fictionalist biconditionals to employ: and if Noonan is right, strict adherence to the fictionalist modification of the equivalences offered by Lewis 1968 provides one suitable way of being careful. It is not uncontroversial, of course, that Noonan’s strategy is the one a modal fictionalist should employ: Divers 1999a and 1999b, Kim 2002 and Divers and Hagen 2006 argue that it is not.

How best to respond to the Brock-Rosen objection continues to be a matter for debate: both Liggins 2008 and Woodward 2008 offer alternatives for the modal fictionalist.

3.2 Hale’s Dilemma

Bob Hale (in Hale 1995b) posed a dilemma for modal fictionalism (more specifically, Rosen’s version of modal fictionalism, though other varieties face a similar dilemma). A modal fictionalist who maintains the version outlined in Rosen 1990 believes that the fiction of possible worlds (PW) is not literally true. A question arises about the modal status of the fiction: is it necessarily false, or contingently false? In either case, Hale argues, the modal fictionalist is in trouble.

Should modal fictionalists claim that the story of possible worlds is necessarily false, then Hale argues that they cannot gloss their “according to the fiction of possible worlds ….” prefix as “were the fiction of possible worlds true, then … would be true”. This is because, according to Hale, conditional claims with antecedents which are necessarily false are automatically true, so if the fiction of possible worlds is taken to be necessarily false, then all conditionals of the form “were the fiction of possible worlds true then …” are true, and not merely the ones that the modal fictionalist wishes to endorse. If the modal fiction is to be useful, not everything should be true according to it: examples of claims that had better not be true according to it include the claim that 2+2=7, or the claim that there are no possible worlds.

On the other hand, if the fiction of possible worlds (PW) is only contingently false, Hale claims this also lands the Rosen’s fictionalism in trouble, since if its falsehood is only contingent, then the fiction might have been literally true (or it is possible that the fiction be true). But according to Hale the “official fictionalist paraphrase” of what this possibility would amount to “cannot adequately capture the content of the claim that possibly PW is true”. (p 65) Hale claims this is so because the claim “According to PW, there is a possible world at which PW is true” is equivalent for Rosen’s fictionalist to “If PW were true, there would be a world at which PW is true”: and this conditional is one which would be true whether or not PW was true.

A modal fictionalist might try to resist either horn of the dilemma. On the first horn, modal fictionalists might employ another gloss on what it is to be true according to PW, or they might endorse one of the various theories of conditionals on which conditionals with necessarily false antecedents are not automatically true. On the second horn, even fictionalists who accepted that they were committed to analysing their claim that PW could have been true as “If PW were true, there would be a world at which PW is true” could dispute Hale’s claim that this is inadequate (see for example Divers 1999b, pp. 325–326).

A third option, explored by Rosen 1995, is not to take PW to be false, but rather altogether lacking a truth-value — e.g., in virtue of employing terms with no literal application, such as “… is a world-mate of…”. Hale’s dilemma is directed primarily against fictionalists who take the literal content of their fiction to be false, and those fictionalists prepared to ascribe some other status to their fictional claims avoid the dilemma as initially stated (though this route may encounter difficulties of its own, especially if it retains some sort of conditional analysis of the “according to PW” prefix).

Rosen 1995 and Divers 1999b are among the responses to Hale, and Hale has in turn responded to Rosen 1995 in Hale 1995a, where Hale argues that several of the responses suggested by Rosen in turn face serious problems. Skiba 2019 points out some complications that arise from addressing this challenge in a way that does not compromise a Divers-style “safety result” of the sort discussed above, though Skiba argues that modal fictionalists can handle these complications.

4. Other Concerns

In addition to the technical challenges facing modal fictionalism outlined in the previous section, modal fictionalism has been challenged on a number of less technical grounds. Not all of these challenges are equally cogent against every variety of modal fictionalism, and some explicitly have as their targets only some versions of the doctrine.

4.1 Artificiality

Fictions are human products: they have authors, and those authors have a good deal of control over what is true according to them (though exactly how much control is controversial). Alternatively, if it is thought that fictions are timeless Platonic abstract entities (sets of propositions, perhaps), we should say that which fictions we consider and express is a matter of human activity: and the ‘authors’ of those eternal Platonic fictions actually expressed have a good deal of control over which of a variety of such fictions they express. However, “theoretical fictions” introduced as an alternative to realist theories, and which are supposed to play a serious role in inquiry, do not seem to be able to be as arbitrary. Not any old story told about possible worlds will serve as the modal fiction, at least if it is to provide the heuristic and other advantages of talk about possible worlds. The suspicion is that in some respects talk of possible worlds cannot be like paradigm fiction, since the ‘choice’ of which story about possible worlds should count as the modal fiction is not as up to us as what to say about Sherlock Holmes was up to Conan Doyle.[6]

Modal fictionalists can certainly respond to the more general worry that fictionalism makes it too arbitrary which particular story about possible worlds ought to be employed. After all, the purposes of the fiction constrain what sorts of fiction are suitable, just as not any old story about a gas will serve to provide an “ideal gas” which has a behaviour approximated by real gases. Some story must be told about what sorts of constraints are appropriate, and why: and this can be difficult in its own right (see the “which fiction should be employed” section, below). Even if there are substantial constraints on what story will be adequate, and these constraints are not due merely to facts about us or our choices, there may still be some scope for the story to be artificial to a small degree, for some points of detail may be left underdetermined by the constraints. This may also be considered a problem, but it is unlikely to be fatal.

There is a more specific worry that remains even if a suitable account of what constraints there are on the modal fiction can be given. This is that it is too contingent a matter whether there is a modal fiction at all. After all, if there had never been any sentient creatures, no stories would ever have been told, and even if the modal fiction is construed as a Platonic entity (a collection of propositions, perhaps), it may never have been a fiction if it was never expressed by story-tellers. (Of course if nothing hangs on whether or not it is a fiction, then this will not worry the Platonist modal fictionalist). This worry, again, is particularly pressing if modal truth is to depend on the contents of the fiction, since it does not seem that whether or not blue swans are possible, for example, depends on whether or not anyone ever told stories. There are responses to this worry, and responses to these responses: see Nolan 1997a, Kim 2005 or Dombrovszki 2017.

Sauchelli 2013 is a recent contribution to this debate that points out another aspect of the problem about artificiality, especially for a fictionalist who intends an analysis of modal claims in terms of a fiction of possible worlds. Many people at different times and in different places have made modal claims: Sauchelli mentions the example of Caesar considering whether he could cross the Rubicon. Most people have little or no contact with fictions of possible worlds, or theories of possible worlds intended to be factual but useable as fictions. Those people lack access to the fictions that are supposed to underpin the truth of their modal claims. Sauchelli claims this makes for both an implausible modal epistemology for figures like Caesar and an implausible account of how people like Caesar can even understand modal claims.

Woodward 2011 uses “the artificiality objection” to refer to both the problem discussed in this section and the problem discussed in section 4.3. That paper contains a response to this artificiality objection on pp. 537–548.

4.2 Incompleteness

Fictions are often incomplete: they are silent about some issues. The Sherlock Holmes stories make no representation one way or the other about the exact population of India, or whether the number of hairs on Dr Watson’s head is odd or even. Arguably, the modal fiction will be incomplete too: there will be some propositions such that neither they nor their negations will be true according to the fiction. This prospect raises several worries.

First, there is the “incompleteness problem” discussed by Rosen in Rosen 1990, pp. 341–345. There are some modal issues (and corresponding issues about the nature of possible worlds) that a realist may well be silent on: not because they believe there is no answer, but rather because they believe themselves ignorant of the answer. A fictionalist who treats the realist’s theory as a fiction, on the other hand, will be silent upon the same issues — but this can lead to a more serious problem. If the fiction is silent on an issue (Rosen’s example concerns the size of worlds), it is not that the issue is unknown — it is that the fiction does not represent a fact of the matter one way or the other. So it might appear for the fictionalist there is not an unknown modal fact — either the claim is false because the corresponding worlds-claim is not true according to the fiction, or something involving a truth-value gap is going on. Rosen also discusses what effect this might have on modal claims corresponding to such silences. A detailed discussion and critique of Rosen on this issue can be found in the following supplementary document:

[Rosen’s Incompleteness Worry]

What is uncontentious is that modal fictionalists operating with fictions which are incomplete in the way, e.g., that the fiction of Rosen 1990 is, will face difficulties, or at least departures from orthodoxy which will be found unattractive by some. Woodward 2012 offers an approach that ensures modal claims are indeterminate in truth value when the fiction of possible worlds is apparently silent about corresponding questions about possible worlds, through offering a treatment of the fiction on which it is indeterminate what the fiction itself represents in these cases. Skiba 2017 criticises both the approach taken in the note above and the approach Woodward offers, and suggests one way out for the modal fictionalist is to endorse apparently contradictory sentences that threaten to follow, but to treat these apparent contradictions as only apparent, since under analysis the modal sentences that appear to contradict each other really express compatible propositions about the modal fiction.

Another “incompleteness” worry in the literature is that expressed in Nolan 1997a. This is also a worry that the modal fiction will not represent as much as is desirable, though the concern is not confined to those areas in which realists might confess ignorance. (The concern resembles an objection Lewis brings against “sparse linguistic ersatzism” in Lewis 1986, pp. 142–165.) A modal fiction, to be adequate, must represent a very great deal about possible worlds, since there are infinitely many claims about possible worlds that must be part of the content of the fiction, if there are to be enough possible-worlds claims to correspond to all the modal claims we would accept. Only a tiny proportion of the propositions about possible worlds needed will be able to be stated explicitly by the modal fictionalist: constraints of time and space and publication costs will mean that the fictionalist will need to describe the fictional worlds in only a few volumes, while an exhaustive explicit description of even a single possible world as complex as our actual world is beyond our finite resources.

What modal fictions will presumably have, however, are generalisations about possible worlds: for instance, principles of recombination and plenitude, principles about what truths are respected by all worlds, and so on. The modal fictionalist might reasonably hope that these generalisations imply all of the specific claims needed by the fiction. Implication is, however, a modal notion: not that this is automatically a problem, but it will be a problem for the “strong” modal fictionalist, who seeks to reductively analyse modality in terms of what is true according to the fiction. The strong modal fictionalist’s analysis will be circular if he has to appeal to something like implication (or related modal notions) to spell out what claims are represented as true by the fiction, as it seems he must if the bulk of the claims are to be represented only implicitly. It seems that a strong modal fictionalist will be stuck with a radically incomplete fiction, if he relies only on what his modal fiction explicitly says, or he faces the task of specifying the implicit content of the modal fiction without recourse to modal notions like implication.

A strong modal fictionalist could attempt to capture non-explicit content in ways that did not rely on modal resources: one way this could be attempted would be to offer a syntactic account (or some other non-modal account) of some sort of consequence relation, and to stipulate that the fiction is to be considered closed under the relation thus specified. However, this is not easy to do in such a way that all of the necessary semantic consequences are indeed “consequences” of the explicit generalisations given. Furthermore, success at this project threatens to undermine the strong modal fictionalist’s project in another way: for if it was possible to give a specification of a relation of “consequence” without relying on primitive modal notions, and that did the work of semantic consequence, then this would offer an analysis of “broadly logical” consequence (and presumably related notions, such as logical necessity and possibility) directly, rather than in terms of what was true according to a modal fiction, thus making the strong modal fictionalist’s analysis of modality in terms of the fiction redundant. So the strong modal fictionalist faces a serious challenge in providing a fiction capable of representing what is needed for his theory to be adequate.

4.3 Which Fiction Should Be Employed?

An essential part of an adequate modal fictionalist theory is a specification of the fiction of possible worlds which is to be employed. As well as selecting one of the many potential candidate stories about worlds, it is also essential to provide an explanation and justification of the choice. This is very rarely done by modal fictionalists (Armstrong 1989 provides an exception). This is not to say that it cannot be done, or cannot be done plausibly: but justifying the choice of fiction is not something that can be neglected if a modal fictionalist theory is to be convincing. Christopher Peacocke (Peacocke 1999, p. 154) charges Rosen’s modal fictionalist with “fetishism” unless the fictionalist can say what is so distinctive about the particular fiction chosen.

As with so many other challenges, timid modal fictionalism can immediately provide the outlines of an answer to this question. (Though it is to be remembered that timid modal fictionalism is able to avoid so many theoretical difficulties only because the fiction is not asked to do much theoretical work). If the truths of possibility and necessity (and conditionality, and other modal truths) obtain without dependence on the content of the modal fiction, it is surely reasonable to suppose that whichever fiction it is correct to employ, it must respect those independently obtaining modal truths. Strong modal fictionalists must also ensure that the contents of the fiction are associated with the modal claims they wish to make in the appropriate way, of course, but this will be of less help to them in establishing the content of the modal fiction. For if the content of the modal fiction is to explain the truth of the modal claims, it must be able to be fixed independently, on pain of circularity. This is especially so if the strong modal fictionalist holds, as one well might, that it is our understanding of the modal fiction that provides (perhaps implicitly) our epistemic access to which modal claims are true and which false. Giving a non-circular specification of the content of the modal fiction is one of the very difficult challenges facing the strong modal fictionalist.

While strong modal fictionalists cannot appeal to an independently constituted body of modal truths, one thing they can do is insist that the modal fiction respect our ordinary modal judgments: that is, that by and large if we accept a modal claim as true, the associated claim involving possible worlds will be true according to the modal fiction. (Rosen 1990, p. 337, speaks of the desideratum that modal fictionalism “ratify a substantial body of prior modal opinion”.) This is presumably not to forbid any departures from our pre-theoretic modal judgements, should they be required, but it would provide a way even for the strong fictionalist to rule out gratuitous departures from our modal opinions.

The next obvious source of content for the modal fiction is the literal truth about our actual world (Rosen 1990, p. 335). The addition of all literally true non-modal propositions (in a suitable sense of “non-modal”) to the fiction as part of its description of the actual world is useful, since it provides a rich source of content that can be extended by, for instance, a principle of recombination, to yield claims about non-actual worlds. It would also seem to be required, for if the fiction fails to be committed to the actual world verifying a certain non-modal truth q, the inference from q to Actually-q and back will be jeopardised. Some particular non-modal truths may prove especially useful: Armstrong 1989, pp. 138–139 mentions analytic truths, truths in virtue of the meanings of terms, in this connection. One can either add the actual-world non-modal content by including an “encyclopedia” in the fiction, as Rosen does, or one could allow it in by, for example, stipulating as extra bridge-laws biconditionals of the form:

P iff According to PW, at the actual world, P

for all non-modal propositions P.

As well as conformity with our pre-theoretic modal judgements and inclusion of an encyclopedia of actual non-modal truths, Rosen 1990 mentions another source of information to apply in specifying the modal fiction. We have practices of forming modal beliefs involving imagining situations in accord with principles of recombination, non-arbitrariness, and so on (p. 339-40). Rosen points out that while a realist has the challenge of explaining why this practice of imagining should be a guide to modal truth, the fictionalist need not face this challenge if those practices are part of the process of constructing the fiction of possible worlds. If the constraints, or limits, on our imaginative practices when considering hypothetical situations are vital in our practice of making many of our modal judgements, it would make sense to similarly constrain the modal fiction.

There are no doubt many other sorts of constraints which a modal fictionalist may appeal to in order to narrow down the class of fictions about possible worlds which are acceptable for her purposes. Even after all of these constraints are in place, however, there may still be the theoretical possibility that more than one fiction about possible worlds (complete or incomplete) satisfies them equally well. A fictionalist facing a choice between equally deserving fictions would need to address the issue of what attitude to take to other modal fictionalists who choose differently. (Should they be judged incorrect? Correct, because judgements about the content of the modal fiction are relative to which (acceptable) fiction is adopted? Or should they be judged to be talking about something else?). Or perhaps the fictionalist could find some way to avoid making the choice of one single fiction. Woodward 2011 explores one way to avoid making this choice: he suggests modifying the fictionalist biconditional to relate modal claims to a range of acceptable fictions, allowing for some truth-value gaps when the acceptable fictions diverge from each other.

If the fictions disagreed sufficiently, there may even be fictions which meet the constraints but which differ on matters which are linked through the fictionalist’s biconditionals with literal modal claims. (This is only possible if the modal truths themselves are not being appealed to as constraints on acceptable fictions, so is not a problem which faces the timid modal fictionalist). If the constraints are not enough to uniquely determine the truth-value of every modal claim, then not only the determinacy of the content of the fiction but the determinacy of the truth-value of some modal claims is at stake. Are those modal claims true or false, or neither? Might they be fiction-relative, so there are no-fault disagreements about them?

This is not the place to attempt to settle the matter of whether constraints are likely to uniquely determine a modal fiction, nor whether it would be genuinely objectionable if they did not do so. Rather, the issues are mentioned as ones to be kept in mind when formulating or defending a modal fictionalist theory.

4.4 The Theoretical Primitives of Modal Fictionalism

Metaphysical theories often rely on resources which are taken as “primitive”: roughly, theoretical resources which are not to be further explained or analysed. Different theories of the same subject matter will often take different resources to be primitive, and while it is a difficult question to decide whether one set of primitives is better or worse than another, evaluation of the relative simplicity, naturalness, or other merits of theoretical primitives is part of the evaluation of rival theories. This sort of comparison can can be especially relevant in areas where disputes between rival theories are not to be settled easily by experiment or observation. Such disputes make up one of the battlegrounds between fictionalists and their rivals, with anti-fictionalists claiming that the unanalysed theoretical resources which fictionalists rely on render fictionalist theories unattractive, or at least relatively unattractive compared to some rival or other.

The central piece of theoretical machinery the modal fictionalist employs is the “According to PW …” operator. When it is glossed in tempting ways, as “if PW were true, then …” or “it follows from PW that …”, it seems to be a modal notion: and if this is not to be further explained, the modal fictionalist cannot use the fiction of possible worlds and its contents as the basis of an analysis of modality in terms of something else. (This sort of analysis is sometimes known as a reductive analysis.) This will only be of concern to some modal fictionalists, of course — timid fictionalists will not have been looking for a reductive analysis of modality based on their fiction in the first place — and some timid fictionalists such as Divers 1999b explicitly endorse modal explanations of the fictionalist operator (Divers 1999b, p. 335). Such fictionalists may be happy to take advantage of possible analyses of “according to the fiction” operators in modal terms, and in so doing provide an answer to the question of how to understand such expressions: but on the other hand, their position may not be attractive to someone primarily concerned to analyse modal operators. (Even timid fictionalism is compatible with a reductionist account of modality, of course, since the timid fictionalist may seek to explain modality in some other terms. It is just that it is not hospitable to reductionist accounts of modality in terms of possible worlds).

A fictionalist who wishes to provide an analysis of modality, on the other hand, had better not take their “according to PW …” operator to be analysed in terms of standard modal devices, or alternatively in terms of possible worlds (see Rosen 1990, pp. 344–345). The canonical version of the theory that Rosen presents takes the “According to PW …” operator to be a primitive one: that is, one which is not to be further analysed, in modal or non-modal terms (Rosen 1995, p. 70). Rosen points out that one might think that his favoured prefix is a modal locution, and if so even his position cannot be said to entirely reduce the modal in favour of the non-modal (Rosen 1990, pp. 344-345). Nevertheless, as he points out, it may still be thought to be some theoretical advance to be able to explain all of the other modal notions using only this one. It is hard to know how the issue of whether or not “according to PW…” should count as a modal operator is to be decided: in any case, it will not be further pursued here.

Regardless of its status as a modal locution, Rosen recognizes that it is a very unsatisfying primitive: the notion of a proposition being true according to PW is an unlikely one to be considered basic and unanalysable. Whether or not this is a fatal flaw of Rosen’s proposal is, he acknowledges, “a matter of somewhat delicate judgement” (Rosen 1990, p. 349). What he does have to say about it, however, is that arguably many realists about possible worlds have also not provided a satisfactory analysis of the “according to the fiction …” operator, and so face the same challenge.[7]

The issue of whether “According to PW…” is a satisfactory theoretical primitive is presumably partly to be settled by seeing what rival theories are possible, and what primitives they need to rely on to account for modality and for fiction. Beyond that, how to settle disputes about the relative attractiveness of primitives is a difficult issue in philosophical methodology. Taking such an apparently complex operator to be unanalysable looks unattractive (Nolan 1997a, pp. 273–274), but the position is perhaps not untenable. A better option for the modal fictionalist interested in analysing modality in terms of the modal fiction might be to attempt a non-modal explanation of what is true according to fiction. In any case, this problem, like many problems for modal fictionalism, does not arise for the timid modal fictionalist. For those fictionalists for which it is a problem, however, the unattractiveness and unintuitiveness of taking “According to PW…” or a similar device to be primitive remain a largely unaddressed challenge.

4.5 Does Modal Fictionalism Deliver Possible Worlds Semantics?

John Divers in Divers 1995 argues that modal fictionalism cannot deliver the benefits of the standard possible worlds semantics for modal discourse. There is a discussion of Divers’s argument in the following supplementary document:

[Modal Fictionalism and Possible Worlds Semantics]

4.6 Three More Concerns

Modal fictionalism has attracted a range of other objections and concerns. Some of these can be generalised to other fictionalist projects; some generalise to other approaches to possible worlds; and some seem to rely on specific features of modal fictionalist proposals. Rather than trying to describe each controversy in detail, I will briefly outline three with some references for those who wish to track down the relevant literature.[8]

The Threat from Abstractionism: Fictionalists seem to need fictions, in the sense of stories or story-like entities. Some realists about possible worlds treat possible worlds themselves as representational entities of the same general sort that fictions seem to be: these theorists are “abstractionists” in the terminology of van Inwagen 1986, or “ersatzers” in the terminology of Lewis 1986. Abstractionists may take worlds to be constructions out of sentences, or perhaps more commonly identify worlds with maximal propositions or with constructions out of propositions (e.g. sets of propositions). Once we have representations that are rich enough to represent every possibility, fictionalists need to explain why they prefer to be be fictionalists rather than identifying possible worlds with the appropriate representations.

Abstractionist realism seems more straightforward than fictionalism in a number of ways, so fictionalists, particularly platonist fictionalists, risk being victims of their own success and collapsing into a kind of realism. (Nolan 1997a p 272 mentions this worry.) Rosen 1990, particulary on pp 328–9, mentions some motivations for a fictionalist to not be an abstractionist. Turp 2011 discusses a similar challenge: on many accounts of the ontology of fiction, fictional worlds would themselves be some sort of existing abstract object, of the sort that a fictionalist who wishes to reject abstractionism seems committed to rejecting. Finally, Dombrovszki 2017 endorses the existence of the possible worlds postulated by a modal fiction: in his “hybrid modal fiction” possible worlds are creatures of fiction but nevertheless exist (much as so-called “fictional realists” hold that Sherlock Holmes is a fictional object that exists). If Dombrovszki is right, this is not so much a threat from abstractionism as an opportunity to be a modal fictionalist and a realist about possible worlds at the same time.

Concern About Concern: Rosen 1990 (pp 349–354) discusses an “argument for concern” against modal fictionalism, analogous to an argument from concern famously offered by Saul Kripke against David Lewis’s counterpart theory. (Kripke 1980 p 45) Hubert Humphrey, upon losing an election, cares that he could have won. On the face of it, he does not care that someone like him elsewhere in reality does win. Yet according to David Lewis’s analysis of what it is for Humphrey to have possibly won, his possibly winning amounts to a “counterpart” of Humphrey winning a (counterpart) election in another possible world.

Likewise, Humphrey presumably does not care very much whether a special story about him claims that he wins in an alternative universe. Rosen, along with many other philosophers, thinks that this would not directly show there was any problem with a theory that accounted for the possibility of Humphrey winning in terms of the goings-on in another concrete universe, or the contents of a distinctive fiction: Humphrey might care about a fact without realising what the analysis of that fact involves (Rosen 1990 p 349). Rosen instead suggests there may be a “pragmatic” cost to the view: those who come to accept it may have to revise substantially what they care about, either by caring more about the goings-on of a story, or less about what could have happened. There is also the question of why we should care about what happens in any of the plausible candidate fictions: this perhaps touches on the question of choosing a fiction discussed in 4.3, above.

Lewis 1986 pp 195–197 argues that a version of the argument from concern can be at least raised about any realist possible worlds theory account of possibility: and, he would likely add, any fictionalist account as well. If Humphrey is unfamiliar with possible-worlds-jargon, he may not take himself to have any concern with possible worlds when it hurts that he could have won. Of course, theorists may wish to offer reasons why some accounts do better in respecting the facts about what we are concerned with than others. (Or indeed give general reasons why no argument from concern is a challenge to theories of possibility.)

About Aboutness: Armour-Garb (2015, 1212–1218) raises a concern for a modal fictionalist seeking an “elliptical rendering” of modal claims in terms of a claim about what is true according to a fiction of possible worlds. It is that the modal claims we begin with are not about the same things as the paraphrases in terms of a fiction of possible worlds. For example, instead of the claim that possibly, there are blue swans, which seems to be about swans and their color, we in effect get a claim about a fiction (we get a claim that means “according to MF, there are blue swans in a possible world”).

This is a problem, according to Armour-Garb, because the point of modal claims involves them being about the things they normally seem to be about, so the modal fictionalist’s substitute is inadequate. A theorist could, of course, endorse the fictionalist biconditional without thinking that modal claims are about a fiction of worlds at all. Rosen 1990 does talk, in the case of strong modal fictionalism, of an “analysis” of modal claims in terms of claims about what is true according to the modal fiction, so modal fictionalists who want to follow him in this need to be clear about whether they think this analysis gives the meaning of the modal claims they use. And if the analysis is intended to give the meaning of modal expressions, they should make clear why it does not change the subject from what we took ourselves to be saying all along.

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